Chaos, chaos-abyss, catastrophe, geological strata, germinal chaos, geological failure, cosmogenesis, collapse, and ‘the birth of the world itself’: these are some of the key terms in Gilles Deleuze’s On Painting, a transcription and translation of seminars delivered in 1981. Despite these orienting concepts that would seem to resonate with the environmental or cosmological orientations of Anthropocene studies, these seminars are highly formalist, focused on the painter’s struggle with paint, canvas, color, wash, brush, hand, eye, planes, frames, line and light. The seminars begin with a stipulative definition that ties painting to catastrophe, a catastrophe that quickly shifts from content (such as Turner’s paintings of fire) to form (painting as an undoing of figures). This deployment of a language of radical destruction to describe the minutiae of artworks might at first seem typical of twentieth-century French philosophy’s inflation of the aesthetics of European high modernism. There was a time when one could still write and think as if the struggles of the world ought to begin and end with aesthetics, and as if a revolution in thinking that begins with aesthetics would amount to a radical politics.
As the seminar progresses, a counter-narrative emerges. Alongside the high modernist abhorrence of cliché narrative figures and representation, there is an attention to all the ways in which the material and technical struggles of painting open out to the genesis of the world and the human organism. Painters take part in a formal geopolitical history. Twentieth-century painting, Deleuze argues, finds the Egyptian ‘signal space’ that preceded the Greek formation of philosophy. It does so not by retrieving Egyptian art but by undoing Greece’s organicism, by freeing line from the organism and then—ultimately—allowing us to understand philosophy as something that might be transformed through a becoming-Egyptian by way of painting:
Perhaps what we’re learning about painting should be of use to us for philosophy. Indeed, the Greek world is sometimes defined philosophically as the world of essences, and that’s not true. The Egyptian world would be much more of the world of essences in which, in fact, the individual figure surrounded by the geometric crystalline contour defines the stable essence separated from the world of phenomena, accidents, and becoming. (200)
Deleuze’s focus on Turner, Cezanne, Klee and Bacon—and his insistence that painting can be neither narrative nor figurative nor concerned with a subject—reinforces this preliminary sense that we are dealing with a form of ‘theory’ closed off not only from the importantly material and political contexts from which works emerge but also from the most important problems of the twentieth century. Chaos, collapse, and catastrophe are not concepts deployed to think about the planet in an era of climate change but strictly formalist terms that refer to the distinct problems of painting. On Painting’s highly formalist absence of context and politics nevertheless generates a radical theory of painting in its approach to what Deleuze refers to as cosmogenesis, where questions are no longer posed within the polity but are shifted towards the problems from which all bodies (political and individual) are generated.
Any structure has a genesis, and even though one poses the problem of genesis from within some structure (such as the history of Western painting), the interrogation of genesis opens any painting or work beyond itself. The seminars track a painter’s relation to the canvas alongside a radically formalist art history in which paintings are fragments of ‘signal space’ that in turn are intertwined with formations of the human organism. Modern art recreates something like the Egyptian signal space where form and ground are on the same plane. This in turn frees painting from the optical and organic space of the Greeks:
The Egyptians achieved haptic vision by placing form and ground on the same plane and by producing three elements: form, ground, and geometrical crystalline contours. But, for us, haven’t we recovered an Egyptian eye through non-Egyptian means, namely, through colorism? Isn’t the haptic eye the eye that draws the inherent relationships of color from an optical external milieu—light, white, and black? (190)
Readers familiar with Deleuze’s work with Guattari (especially Anti-Oedipus) will recognize a peculiar relationship between philosophy and its others. Rather than a philosophy of art, and rather than an aesthetics, Deleuze’s attention to the specific material struggle of painting and the internal history of painting is preceded by a question of whether painting has anything to say to philosophy. Painting bears its own force and history; to explore that history is to take up one of many of the ways in which the world has been actualized. (Intuiting the genesis of that actualization allows one to arrive at the virtual, the potentiality of color, before color, or color in its pure state.) Painting does not represent the world; painting decomposes the world, undoing the figures and forms through which we see and think. The history of painting is directly related to the history of the organism. Each painter takes up a relation between the hand, the eye, space and light. Here, Deleuze draws upon Worringer and a conception of the northern or Gothic line, in which line is freed from the eye and takes up a force of its own. It is as if the painter were not only liberated from the eye but also liberated from the organism, releasing forces of nonorganic life:
The life of the abstract Gothic line is a nonorganic life. It’s a life beyond the capacities of the organism and the organic. It’s the violence of nonorganic life that counters and punctures the classical world of representation, that is, the world of organic life. Organisms crumble under the rift caused by such powerful, inorganic life. The abstract Gothic line is a vital line. It’s nongeometrical. It’s a vital abstraction. (99)
Even though this book is clearly part of the line of inquiry that led to Deleuze’s book on Francis Bacon—and the editors helpfully cross reference that book—the guiding concept of catastrophe makes sense as part of a broader counter-philosophical and counter-historical project that runs through Deleuze’s corpus as a whole, along with his work with Guattari. By counter-historical, I refer to the many ways in which Deleuze aims to intuit the geneses of the synthesis of time. In On Painting, Deleuze works with art history up to a point, so that (for example) the practices of painting in a frame, and then on an easel, and then on a wall or surface liberated from the easel, make sense as part of a broader genealogy of spatial and visual relations. (He refers to Paul Virilio’s work on the architectural emergence of windows that would, in turn, create a new optics: a framed space and a distanced eye.)
Deleuze also brackets what philosophy’s relation to painting might be in order to look at how painting both forms and deforms its composition of relations. This is in keeping with his counter-philosophical (or perhaps meta- or hyper-philosophical) project of immanence: rather than beginning with philosophical figures (or what Difference and Repetition refers to as an ‘image of thought’), one thinks about genesis in general as the coming into being of relations among forces. Rather than think of a subject or some other point of origin that goes through time, Deleuze pulls apart the constituted figures that compose history and philosophy and charts the singular way in which chaos generates the forms through which we see and think. Deleuze’s stipulative definition of painting—that it cannot be figurative or narrative and that it bears an essential relation to catastrophe—also ties into his philosophy of time, or his project of intuiting time in its pure state. Importantly, though, the project is collective and para-philosophical in its speculative bet that practices other than philosophy open different and often disruptive events of time and space.
There is a conceptual arc to these seminars, where the problem of catastrophe and germinal chaos is crucial to the painterly task of uncovering that which precedes synthesized time. The seminars will trace the different ways in which painters undo the already constituted figures in the history of painting in order to take up a relation to chaos. This problem of the synthesis of time is at once Kantian but also counter-Kantian insofar as there is no subject or ground for synthesis but rather an assemblage (or relation among forces) from which terms emerge. In the case of Cezanne it is color that will be generated after the undoing of figures and the approach to chaos:
… he could see that the noumenon/phenomenon relationship in Kant’s work was such that, in a certain way, the phenomenon was the appearance of the noumenon. Hence the theme: colors are noumenal ideas, colors are the noumena, and space and time are the form of the appearance of noumena, that is, of colors. Colors appear in space and in time, but in themselves, they are neither space nor time. (7)
These seminars were transcribed (by David Lapoujade) from voice recordings (rather than notes) and ably translated by Charles Stivale (along with the Deleuze seminars Translation Collective). That collective labor is in keeping with Deleuze’s corpus as a whole, which moves beyond individual voices and thinkers towards the problems that bring bodies into being. Deleuze’s tone in these seminars is often that of the magisterial French thinker—dismissing, as he does, many of the banalities of everyday thinking. Nothing is more stupid, he declares, than the idea of the writer or artist facing a blank page with nothing to say (33). There’s always too much noise and too many clichéd figures that need to be destroyed in order to begin. The almost cartoonish figure of the artist standing at the easel, one hand covering the eye so that the hand might be guided by a vision that captures the world: this too is treated with derision.
The idea that paintings depict a subject, or that they are oriented towards some intended object, is yet one more obstacle that stands in the way of understanding painting. The guiding hypothesis of the seminars is that we do not yet have an understanding of the real problem of painting and that such an understanding might only be generated through a series of explorations rather than a philosophy being applied to an archive or history of art objects. If Deleuze’s tone is often dismissive—some interjections by students are simply laughed away—he is just as often responsive to ideas drawn from the expertise of seminar participants. The seminars track a collective movement that undoes both the figure of the artist and the image of the lone genius philosopher.
At the level of content, the problem that propels the journey of these seminars—what is painting as a mode of thinking that is not yet philosophy but might offer something to philosophy?—begins from a formalism that undoes the artist as subject, as individual agent whose intentionality precedes and governs the frame. In a manner that is somewhat akin to modernist conceptions of impersonality, the painting comes into being only with a rigorous practice of undoing, in which the clichés and figures that populate the canvas can’t simply be erased but require a ‘diagram’ that will reorient the painter towards a generative or ‘germinal’ chaos.
The crucial opening claim of the seminars is that painting is defined through catastrophe, both in its approach towards a chaos that might not allow anything distinct to be generated and in its necessary destruction of anything figurative, narrative or representational. This does not mean that all painting is abstract in the usual sense of abstraction, but rather that whatever painting seems to depict comes about by abstracting, and then rendering visible, the invisible forces that are generative of form. In the case of Francis Bacon, to take just one example, the bodies depicted are a means to render something like the weight of flesh; a sleeping body becomes a way of capturing nonorganic life—not the animating life of the organism, but the forces that have a life of their own beyond that of organisms and humanity (52). The central example of this nonorganic life in On Painting is the northern or Gothic line, where line no longer serves to create contours or mark out bodies but bears its own power to veer away from bounded forms (99).
Towards the end of On Painting, Deleuze will turn to Pollock and the liberation of the canvas from the easel (no longer akin to a window and optical space), along with the liberation of the hand from the eye: not a digital hand (where digits articulate space and time) and not a tactile hand that is still subordinated to the organism and its own relations but a hand that is manual:
When the hand shakes off its subordination to the eye, when it imposes itself on the eye, when it does violence to the eye, when it strikes back against the eye, that’s what I’d call properly “manual”. And, in contrast, the “digital” is the hand’s absolute subordination to the eye. It’s not even that the hand’s tactile qualities are enlisted in the eye’s service. Rather, the hand has dissolved; only a finger remains for picking between visual binaries. The hand is reduced to a finger pressing on a keyboard. It’s the computerized hand. It’s the handless finger (118).
Here is where Deleuze’s formalism intersects with his more explicitly political work with Guattari, especially Anti-Oedipus and its similar deployment of Andre Leroi-Gourhan and the history of the human organism as co-evolving with technics. The manual hand, the hand no longer bound to an eye that maps space and commands forces for the sake of its own formed interests, opens to what we might refer to as a ‘people to come’ or a humanity that is no longer grounded in an already determined ‘we’. The history of art that informs On Painting is intensively formalist; rather than an artist in command of matter for the sake of expressing an idea or content (where the artist and painting are objects within the world of extended matter), it is from relations among matters that a world emerges.
Here, Deleuze implicitly opposes the basic premise of phenomenology that would situate the world or worlds within ways of seeing and existing. Instead, worlds come into being from a nonorganic life, or forces that precede organisms. Painting is therefore defined initially in relation to catastrophe with a ‘diagram’ being required to pull apart figures in an approach to germinal chaos. What comes into being is the genesis of the world. Painting is a synthesis: not a synthesis of the subject who brings into being or unfolds a life world but the synthesis of time through relations among forces. Deleuze’s formalism concerns the genesis of forms, and these include the form of the human organism and the ways in which space, time and a sense of who ‘we’ are comes into being from a germinal chaos. Painting is an art of forces, not forms, and those forces, in turn, are not what is painted; the painting is a rendering visible of what cannot be seen as such.
At the level of form, On Painting enacts a quite specific pedagogy that is analogous to the event of painting. Even though the transcribed seminars are dominated by the voice of Deleuze, the content of the seminars follows from a posed problem and a journey. Not knowing what a painting is, not knowing whether there is, or ought to be, a philosophy of painting, and not knowing what a painting is doing, allows the discussion of the seminars to follow a problem. The form of the seminars is intensely collective, partly through some of the provocative interventions from Anne Querrien, Georges Comtesse, Richard Pinhas and unnamed students, but also because the seminars follow the movements of paint, canvas, brush, palette, bulb baster, sticks and easels. In the beginning is not chaos, but the problems through which a body might approach chaos. The seminars chart the movements of the canvas, the production of space of time from relations among forces, and the retrieval of other potentialities. The seminars will conclude with an observation that if philosophy’s supposed birthplace is Greece, this is preceded by an Egyptian wisdom of essences. The philosopher is a lover of wisdom, not wise, but one who bears a relation to the pure truth of the world through the organic forms that express essences. The problem of painting, and not a philosophy of painting, works through each painter’s encounter with chaos.
In his much earlier and somewhat more classically philosophical monograph, Difference and Repetition, Deleuze defines all life as an orientation towards solving a problem rather than a statistical evolution where living forms are the result of chance combinations (151). When Deleuze opens these seminars with the problem of painting and philosophy, he very quickly creates the concept of catastrophe: not just the painting of catastrophe that we would find in Turner’s later canvases, but an immanent and definitive catastrophe that is tied to chaos, the diagram, figures, planes and the genesis of the world. Because the canvas is already populated with figures, and because the painter works in a ‘signal space’ that has a history (from Egypt, through Greece, to European modernity), a diagram needs to be created that will allow the undoing of already formed figures in space.
This in turn allows an approach to chaos, with chaos being generative—even if there is a risk of collapse. Posing the concept of catastrophe from the beginning allows the seminars to explore the different ways in which modern painters find ways to undo (but not erase) the figures that compose the world and that compose the relations among hand, eye, nervous system, brain and matter. This is not Deleuze as philosopher applying a method to works of art, nor is it a theory of artworks or an aesthetics in the sense of a theory of beauty, value or the experience of art. The seminars chart a pedagogy of chaos, both through a witnessing of each painter’s struggle with chaos and through an undoing of the standard problems of a philosophy of painting. Each painter/painting comes into being through an apprenticeship with form and matter, and each seminar participant follows that encounter, which is both thoroughly within European modernism, while also placing the singular history of painting as one of many events of genesis that would unfold a world that might always be otherwise and that might also be generative of a new humanity.