How to Be Grateful is a new translation of the Bancroft Dialogues by two of the most eminent scholars in Nahua Studies, Drs. Frances Karttunen and Camilla Townsend. The Bancroft Dialogues is a series of sixteenth-century conversational exchanges intended to capture forms of noble speech between various Nahuatl-speaking people. It was likely authored by a Texcocan who was probably a baptized Christian and knew alphabetic script, although there is a possibility that the author recited dialogues that someone else transcribed. “Pablo” is quite possibly a pseudonym but could also have been the author’s name.
The dialogues were likely written between 1550-1570, a time when proselytizing friars were collecting ethnographic materials in search of cultural and linguistic angles to convert the Nahuas more effectively to Christianity. These dialogues were copied by one “don Miguel” for a “father Horacio”, most likely Horacio Carochi, the Jesuit priest and author of Arte de la lengua mexicana, which is the most important and authoritative classical Nahuatl grammar we have. Although they are likely the product of an outside request, assignment, or commission, these dialogues capture more than just noble Nahua speech; they capture the ways in which Nahua people expressed gratitude, respect, and advice for living well. And while these dialogues contain various signs of Christian influence, there is much about them that captures pre-contact Nahua lifeways, sensibilities, values, and expectations.
After offering some basics about Nahuatl pronunciation, Karttunen and Townsend provide a very helpful introduction. They first outline some basic historical context that appropriately emphasizes the role to Texcoco in the Valley of Mexico, its role in the Triple Alliance before and during the conquest, as well as its struggles to maintain its post-conquest autonomy and sovereignty. They then discuss Pablo of Texcoco, outline the dialogues, their main messages, and summarize the history of the text. They follow this with clarifying remarks on the transcription and translation. Karttunen and Townsend follow their translation with a helpful glossary and copious notes that assist the reader with additional contextual detail, explanations of common Nahua locutions and idioms (especially those that are repeated throughout the text), and suggestions for further reading.
The dialogues themselves are divided into three parts, yet the translators maintain the subsections that were added sometime after the dialogues were produced. The first part takes place in the present where a young noblewoman on her way to the market pays a visit to a relative’s home. This exchange is followed by various exchanges between a trained speaker (who eventually is named Pablo), a married couple, a governor, parents, and a nobleman.
The second part transports the reader to the past, where there are exchanges related to a marriage arrangement and the reception of a new bride to the king, who is later identified as the Texcocan ruler, Ixtlilxochitl, the son of Nezahualpilli and grandson of Nezahualcoyotl. There are also exchanges regarding the new queen giving birth, as well as speeches after the king had died.
The third part transports the reader back to the present. This is the largest part of the translation, with multiple exchanges of various sorts. There is a speech on how boys should comport themselves, as well as exchanges between the boys and various other characters including a friar, a grandmother, a mother, and an elderly noblewoman. The boys are revealed to be direct descendants of Ixtlilxochitl, and the dialogue has the grandmother recall times before European contact. There are exchanges between an elderly noblewoman and the boys’ mother, as well as exchanges between the boys, their mother, their uncle, and other adults. Lastly, there are exchanges between a host of other characters including singers, noblemen, their governor, and the prior to a Franciscan monastery, among others.
My remarks will be limited to my overall assessment, some minor critiques that might be useful for a possible second edition, and its usefulness in the classroom. To begin with, I find this edition to be eminently successful in accomplishing multiple aims. As a translation for a general audience, it makes a significant contribution to Nahua Studies in that it provides a complete, accessible, and highly readable edition that could be made relevant to both undergraduate students and general readers alike. Previously, Karttunen and Lockhart’s excellent study and translation of the Bancroft Dialogues was the only other complete edition available; however, it was perhaps better suited for more advanced study.[1]
How to Be Grateful provides a nice compliment to this more comprehensive and in-depth study. Its helpful introduction, glossary, and notes provide sufficient context, nuance, and detail to keep the reader engaged. And the notes provide plentiful additional readings to those who are eager for more serious study. The translation set alongside the Nahuatl transcription (with helpful diacritics) would be obviously useful to students learning Nahuatl and specialists in the field. It would be also beneficial to graduate students in diverse academic fields who wish to engage in deeper study of Nahua thought and culture. For those who are interested in reconstructing pre-European Nahua thought, this text is among the best sources we have that is relatively close to pre-European Nahua thought with philosophical significance. Ultimately, this edition does exceedingly well to provide general readers greater access to Nahua history, literature, and philosophy.
My critiques are relatively minor, but I think the edition could be improved in two ways. First, I would have liked a little more explanation from Karttunen and Townsend about how this text exemplifies Nahua gratitude, more specifically, a more detailed sketch on what they think the text conveys regarding its depth and scope. To be sure, the text is rife with expressions of gratitude, respect, and courtesy. The translators also take pains to explain the three main ways in which Nahuatl expressions of gratitude are found in the text, and why they translate them as they do. They also highlight that gratitude had an intergenerational scope that involved repaying the work of previous generations and doing one’s duty for future generations, who will in turn thank them for the work they did to make life viable. With this, the translators suggest that for the Nahuas, gratitude was in some ways more substantive and expansive than what it is commonly thought today, and it played a larger role in social relations. However, what the translators say about Nahua gratitude might leave non-specialists wanting more detail on what the translators think that fuller concept of gratitude would be, details that might help non-specialists learn from the Nahuas new dimensions or nuances that were previously underappreciated. Perhaps this is to be expected, as offering a detailed interpretation might surpass the function of this work as a translation; however, a more detailed sketch would perhaps give the reader a more solid foundation upon which to base further study and deeper reflection on the importance and relevance of gratitude in their everyday lives.
Second, I would have also liked Karttunen and Townsend to offer more notes detailing some of the backstory on their translation choices. I say this not because I question them; rather, I think it would be helpful for readers to gain a sense of the competing aims, challenges, and nuances that translators must balance to arrive at the translations they commit to print. This would be particularly true for readers who know little to no Nahuatl and are often unaware of the many difficulties that translators face. For example, I would like to know more about how they translate the Nahuatl text into words like wisdom, prudence, good, bad, vice, and evil. These words carry significant philosophical baggage, which is not to say that these translation choices are incorrect or problematic. However, like the various Nahuatl expressions of gratitude, it would be helpful to have more detail about the interpretive challenges with which the translators grappled to arrive at the translations that they did. Perhaps this is also asking too much, as this is not intended to be a critical translation with commentary; however, a few more peeks behind the scenes would be helpful in providing readers insight into the process, which could perhaps spark more interest in learning Nahuatl and the painstaking work that translators do to bring Nahua texts to a wider audience.
At any rate, I find that this edition can have several uses in courses. To begin with, I can see students working in groups to unpack Nahua philosophical commitments underlying key texts that contain expressions of value or advice for living well. Needless to say, the instructor would need to provide the students an appropriate level of historical and cultural context; however, a close reading exercise like this would help students grapple more deeply with the text and begin to see the philosophical content that often lurks throughout it. It would also be a great way for students to contend with the difficulties in teasing out any Christian/European influences on what’s expressed.
This exercise could be done by the instructor first isolating several key texts that students would analyze. The instructor would then ask the students to break into groups and choose one of the preselected texts. Student would then analyze the text to identify key philosophical commitments they find important and meaningful. The goal would be for the entire class to cooperate in analyzing several passages and share their results for all to benefit.
For example, on pages 9-13, there is a rich passage where a trained speaker offers advice to a newly married couple. In it, he advises the couple to “…beware lest you follow the path of the rabbit, the deer; beware lest you fall from a precipice, lest you fall into the river” (9). The trained speaker then offers individual advice to the groom and bride, respectively. This text is packed with interesting philosophical commitments on the creator’s role in the marriage, how the spouses are to conduct their lives to preserve themselves and their marriage, and the individual role each spouse plays in all this. More specifically, there are philosophical commitments about work, gender roles and relations, and how all this serves the intentions of the creator. It goes without saying that students will likely detect some Christian/European influence; however, that also would be useful insofar as they would have to contend with this ever-present dimension of studying colonial-era Nahua texts. There are many such texts like this; indeed, this could be done with virtually any bit of text in the edition, depending what the instructor would like to emphasize.
As mentioned above, the Nahua concept of gratitude has an intergenerational scope. In light of this, I can also see this edition being paired with an assignment that asks students to explore their relationship to past and future generations. This might include asking students to inquire into the history of their family, their nationality or ethnicity, or any other community to which the student belongs and has a meaningful connection. The point would be to have the students explore how they see their relationship to both the previous generations and future ones of their chosen community. More specifically, they can articulate what, if anything, they owe to previous generations and what duties, if any, they have to future ones. They could also articulate the extent to which previous or later generations are real to them in their everyday lives. That is, the assignment can ask to what extent, if any, the students’ ancestors and/or future generations are part of their own thinking, lifeways, and life decisions. This assignment might be helpful for students to gain a broader consciousness of their place and role in a community they find important and meaningful.
Lastly, and as the translators anticipate, this edition can be used to generate student discussions on the role of gratitude in their everyday lives. This could involve an in-class writing exercise where students articulate to themselves some of the most important things in their respective lives for which they are grateful, after which they can share in small groups or more broadly to the class. This could be paired with an assignment that asks students to start a gratitude practice (e.g., a gratitude journal, expressing gratitude before a meal, or making a point to express gratitude each day to a different loved one). Students can do this for a short period of time, and then share how this practice has affected their outlook on themselves and their sense of connection to their world. In sum, Karttunen and Townsend have produced a wonderful and useful edition for which we can all be grateful.
REFERENCES
The Art of Nahuatl Speech: The Bancroft Dialogues, Edited with a preliminary study by Frances Karttunen and James Lockhart, UCLA Latin American Studies Volume 65, (Los Angeles: Regents of the University of California, 1987).
[1] The Art of Nahuatl Speech: The Bancroft Dialogues, Edited with a preliminary study by Frances Karttunen and James Lockhart, UCLA Latin American Studies Volume 65,
(Los Angeles: Regents of the University of California, 1987).