David Edmonds’ Parfit belongs to a burgeoning genre. There are the two recent collective biographies of Anscombe, Foot, Midgley and Murdoch (by Benjamin Lipscomb and by Claire Mac Cumhaill and Rachael Wiseman). There are M.W. Rowe’s J.L. Austin: Philosopher and D-Day Intelligence Officer and Nikhil Krishnan’s A Terribly Serious Adventure. Earlier works include Ray Monk’s Russell and Wittgenstein volumes, Tom Regan’s Bloomsbury’s Prophet, and Bart Schultz’s books on Sidgwick and the other classical utilitarians. And Edmonds himself is inter alia the author of The Murder of Professor Schlick and the coauthor of Wittgenstein’s Poker.
Derek Parfit stands out among the subjects of these various works for being so contemporary. Edmonds could draw on a vast collection of stories conveying Parfit’s legendary eccentricity. But he also took on in a particularly acute form the challenge of writing simultaneously for two quite different audiences. One audience consists of philosophers, some of whom are the sources of the stories and almost all of whom know a good deal about Parfit and his ideas. The other audience consists of general readers who are apt to come to the book knowing little or nothing about either.
I think Edmonds meets this challenge admirably. He is a lively and amusing writer. Readers of Notre Dame Philosophical Reviews are unlikely to turn to his book for an introduction to Parfit’s ideas. But it is likely to be the place where some readers with less philosophical training first encounter teletransporter cases, future Tuesday indifference, and the repugnant conclusion. They are in good hands. Edmonds’ portrayals of the various communities Parfit inhabited—including the austerity Britain of the 40s and early 50s in which he grew up and the quadrangles of Eton and All Souls in which he flourished—are economical and convincing. And his account of the philosophical world he so dazzlingly entered (with his 1971 article “Personal Identity”) is similarly reliable. (For the record I have exactly one quibble. P.F. Strawson is introduced as one of Parfit’s tutors for the BPhil in the 60s, and as then “best known for his paper “Freedom and Resentment”” (81). This seems to me anachronistic. As an Oxford undergraduate in the 80s, I followed my tutors’ advice and attended Strawson’s lectures. I think that advice was a product of the esteem in which my tutors held “On Referring,” Individuals, and The Bounds of Sense. It is only more recently, after the rise of the agency theory industry, that Strawson’s reputation has come to be dominated by “Freedom and Resentment”; that was not how he was seen in Oxford in the 60s or the 80s.)
The stories of Parfit’s eccentricity, many of which will be familiar to the philosophically initiated audience, are the book’s most distinctive driver. Here is a sample
Because of Parfit’s idiosyncratic relationship to the clock, students frequently received telephone calls at less than ideal times. One afternoon Sophia Moreau and Parfit got stuck trying to crack a particular problem. The following morning, her phone rang at 3 a.m., waking her up. ‘My friends didn’t call me at that hour. But I had family overseas, so I initially thought that something terrible must have happened back home. I picked up the phone with a shaking hand. It was Derek’s voice. He didn’t say, “Sorry to bother you at this hour” or even “Hello, it’s Derek!” He just said, “About the problem on page 5…” Once he explained his proposed resolution, he paused, and then hung up.” (245)
But the larger story that Edmonds tells, and the main biographical question he goes on to wrestle with, may be less familiar. Parfit was, unsurprisingly, a precocious child and a very talented young adult. But he was also, more surprisingly, strikingly well-rounded—altogether more Keynes than Kripke. Edmonds quotes some childhood writings, noting among other things a “mouthwatering description” of a meal the then ten-year-old Parfit enjoyed as a visitor to France (20). He reports his closest Eton friend, Edward Mortimer, as saying “I was quite ready to see him become prime minister. . .but not a reclusive Oxford philosopher” (25). He describes an undergraduate career that included not just a first in Modern History but also becoming editor of Isis (one of the main Oxford student publications—editorship of Isis could well lead to a career in journalism, as prominence in Oxford student drama could lead to an acting career). The book’s structure reflects the two quite different halves of Parfit’s life. The chapters in the first half of the book are organized chronologically. The chapters in the second half are arranged thematically. It is there that we find Parfit the duomaniac—devoted to philosophy and architectural photography—and then Parfit the monomaniac—devoted exclusively to philosophy.
Edmonds’ initial hypothesis to explain the eccentricity was that Parfit was autistic. But, he reports
Not a single person from his early life raised the subject of autism of their own accord, and many were scathingly dismissive of applying it to Parfit. (333)
Edmonds was then led to seek some alternative explanation—perhaps the alarming concoction of pills and alcohol Parfit relied on as a soporific. But he ended up with a third position, spelled out in the final chapter, “Parfit’s Gamble”. As I understand it, the idea is in part that Parfit always had autistic tendencies, which he managed during his earlier life largely to mask. But it is also that the change from the earlier to the later Parfit was in part a choice: a gamble that would be justified if Parfit’s intellectual contributions were great enough, even if it meant genuine sacrifices of much that makes most human beings’ lives worth living. The last few lines of the book spell out Edmonds’s own view about this gamble and its justification
If the work produced is of seminal value, then the life devoted to it might reasonably be judged as worthwhile, in spite of its self-sacrifice. But if it is not, then it will seem wasted and impoverished.
Readers can turn to Parfit’s work, and reach their own verdict. My own view, and the reason I wrote this book, is that his gamble paid off (336).
But this raises the question—which Edmonds of course discusses—of the relative value of Reasons and Persons and On What Matters. Pretty much everyone would agree that, if there are works of philosophy the production of which would justify the sacrifice Edmonds tentatively depicts Parfit as having made, Reasons and Persons is among them. But, as Edmonds also notes, the reception of On What Matters has on the whole been considerably less enthusiastic. Reasons and Persons was the product of a period of feverish activity driven by All Souls’ initial refusal to grant Parfit a Senior Research Fellowship. If the gamble dates from this period, if the eccentricities and mono (or duo) mania necessary to produce Reasons and Persons were then ingrained, we might get one answer to the question whether the gamble was worth it. If, instead, the gamble is understood as made later and as necessary to produce On What Matters, we might get another.
In this connection it is also worth reflecting a bit on the idea in Edmonds’ subtitle—the idea of the mission to save morality. No doubt the idea is biographically compelling. It is very striking that both of Parfit’s parents and all four of his grandparents were missionaries. And there is something clearly right about the idea that Parfit’s single-minded devotion to philosophical work exhibited a missionary zeal. But in other ways the idea is more problematic. Consider the defense of metaethical non-naturalism in part six of On What Matters. Parfit’s work, along with that of Nagel, Scanlon, and others, was crucial in reviving the reputation of non-naturalism. But, if non-naturalism is true, its truth is independent of Parfit’s or Nagel’s or Scanlon’s advocacy. It was true when Sidgwick and Moore and Ross defended it in the late 19th and early 20th centuries. It was still true in the 50s, 60s, and 70s notwithstanding the incomprehension and ridicule it then routinely received. It was true when Parfit et. al. revived its reputation; but their work didn’t make it true. And, however much Parfit may have regretted his failure (as he saw it) to impart to Bernard Williams the concept of a normative reason, that failure was no threat to Williams’s immortal soul.
Edmonds brings out the way in which Parfit’s single-minded devotion to philosophical work was by no means simply a devotion to his own work. He did pursue his own work with uncompromising zeal. He was the perfectionist scourge of every production editor who had the misfortune to be assigned to him. And his method in revising and developing On What Matters, soliciting and receiving comments from huge numbers of other philosophers, depended on his elevated status and is unavailable to ordinary mortals. But he was also a benign and helpful senior member of the profession. He gave extraordinarily thorough and constructive comments to many other philosophers. Edmonds compares Parfit’s influence on his students to Wittgenstein’s influence on his, very much to Parfit’s advantage. Parfit’s students were not told to give up philosophy and to devote themselves to manual work for which they lacked aptitude and were temperamentally unsuited. They were instead encouraged and supported in their philosophical ambitions (even if they were also sometimes the recipients of 3 a.m. phone calls).
Some philosophers do not enjoy intellectual biographies of philosophers—Parfit himself was presumably among them. To those who do, I recommend Edmonds’ book unreservedly. It’s a great read.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
Many thanks to Roger Crisp and to Justin Coates for very helpful feedback on a draft of this review.
REFERENCES
Edmonds, D. (2020) The Murder of Professor Schlick (Princeton: Princeton University Press).
Edmonds, D. and Eidinow, J. (2001) Wittgenstein’s Poker (New York: Harper Collins).
Krishnan, N. (2023) A Terribly Serious Adventure (New York: Random House).
Lipscomb, B. (2021) The Women Are Up To Something (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Mac Cumhaill, C. and Wiseman, R. (2022) Metaphysical Animals (New York: Doubleday).
Monk, R. (1990) Ludwig Wittgenstein (New York: The Free Press).
Monk, R. (1996) Bertrand Russell: The Spirit of Solitude 1872-1921 (New York: The Free Press).
Monk, R. (2000) Bertrand Russell: The Ghost of Madness 1921-1970 (New York: The Free Press).
Parfit, D. (1971) ‘Personal Identity’ Philosophical Review 80: 3-27.
Parfit, D. (1984) Reasons and Persons (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Parfit, D. (2011) On What Matters (2 Volumes; Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Regan, T. (1986) Bloomsbury’s Prophet (Philadelphia: Temple University Press).
Rowe, M.W. (2023) J.L. Austin (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Schultz, B. (2004) Henry Sidgwick (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Schultz, B. (2017) The Happiness Philosophers (Princeton: Princeton University Press).
Strawson, P.F. (1950) ‘On Referring’ Mind 59: 320-344.
Strawson, P.F. (1959) Individuals (Garden City N.Y.: Routledge).
Strawson, P.F. (1962) ‘Freedom and Resentment’ Proceedings of the British Academy 48: 187-211.
Strawson, P.F. (1966) The Bounds of Sense (New York: Routledge).