This volume is the eighteenth in an ongoing series of publications dating back to 2013 under the general editorial direction of John Dillon and Andrew Smith aimed at translations of and commentaries on all the treatises in Plotinus’s Enneads.[1] The treatise I 8 is a chronologically late treatise by Plotinus, number 51, as reported by Porphyry. This fact suggests that we should be prepared to discover in the treatise a highly complex background of assumptions and arguments resulting from the many years of research, teaching, and writing that preceded, to say nothing of some 800 years or so of philosophical work that Plotinus has inherited and assimilated. To a certain extent this is true, but somewhat less than a reader coming to Plotinus for the first time might suppose. In fact, the treatise is one of the more accessible ones, requiring only a rudimentary knowledge of Platonism, especially in its later refinements.
The topic with which this treatise engages is still today a lively one among both philosophers and theologians. Its central problem is easily articulated: if God or the Good or the One or the first principle of all (or whatever name we choose to employ) exists, we might also be led to conclude that this first principle must be both omnipotent and omnibenevolent. If this is the case, how can there be evil in the world? One might well argue—and many philosophers have indeed argued—that if evil exists, then either the first principle is not omnibenevolent, or it is not omnipotent. Either this principle is unwilling to prevent evil from happening or it is unable to do so. If, however, this is so, what significance remains for the claim that such a principle exists?
In reading Plotinus, it is important to bear in mind that this problem arises within an entirely non-religious philosophical tradition. It is not a problem generated by scriptural claims that, because of a certain type of anthropomorphizing, make the attribution or denial of the properties of omnipotence and omnibenevolence (and omniscience) especially urgent for numerous theological reasons. Thus, Plotinus recognizes the pantheon of Greek gods, but for him the problem of evil is not a problem about whether or not Zeus loves us or even cares for us.
In I 8, Plotinus simply assumes that there is a first principle of all, and that it is omnipotent and omnibenevolent. He takes as given that Plato has established this when he argues that there is a superordinate principle of all, the Idea of the Good, which, because of its transcending any essential limitation, is omnipotent and, because it is the principle of all goods, eternally engages in activity that is equivalent to its omnibenevolence. On this basis, he focuses on the nature of evil in pursuit of a solution to the above problem. His solution, arising from his definition of evil, is simple to state and almost impossible not to misunderstand on first hearing: evil is matter. In order to overcome the misunderstanding that Plotinus is here avoiding the problem on behalf of the promotion of a type of pagan asceticism or mortification of the flesh, we need to realize that in his use of the technical philosophical term “matter”, Plotinus is undeniably engaging with Aristotle.
Despite Plotinus’s heartfelt devotion to a life devoted to the exegesis of Plato’s writings, Plato does not himself use this technical term. Elsewhere, Plotinus argues that the primary meaning of this term is equivalent to what Aristotle calls “prime matter”, that is, a completely formless and unintelligible principle inseparable from any hylomorphic composition. Thus, “secondary” or “proximate” matter is only a metaphorical analogue of true matter, since every example of this is already informed. So, the human body is not really matter for the soul, since the human being is not formless. The body is only “matter” in relation to the soul.
On behalf of this interpretation of Aristotle’s account of matter, Plotinus argues that, contrary to Aristotle’s view, potency and privation are not distinct principles in the analysis of the motion and activities of hylomorphic composites. Their distinction might have some epistemological meaning, but ontologically, privation, for example, “not standing” or “not cold” do not indicate anything other than what is indicated by saying that the sitting thing or hot thing has the potency for standing or for being cold. So, pure potency and pure privation are extensionally equivalent. The salient consequence of this argument is that in the twin concepts of “potency” and “privation”, we will find the basis for claiming that if matter is evil, we will be able to see both what is “bad” in matter and also what is inseparable from the result of the activity of that which is supremely good and supremely powerful.
For Plotinus, evil is the opposite of good in a precise ontological sense. Since the Good eternally “overflows” and since the result of that overflowing is the being of everything, evil is to be situated beyond the limit of the overflowing. This means that when every possible enformed being is created, at the limit, so to speak, is that which is beyond form or shape or essence. This is matter, which is, as a principle, the condition for the possibility of any hylomorphic composite, that is, anything with any type of form that, as a result, has the potency for doing anything that that kind of thing can do. So, as a necessary condition for the fullness of creation, matter is not evil; it is inevitable and a condition for there being any goodness in the world at all.
And yet, since everything, as Plato says, desires its own true good and acts accordingly, even if they do so under a mistaken impression that what is in fact bad is really good, to turn away from this good is to turn in the “direction” of evil. The limit of a turn in this direction is, therefore, to be totally bereft of form or essence. The being of something attaining to absolute evil would be in fact the dissolution of that being by separating what it is from its own existence. So, matter is evil only under one description: the terminus of a trajectory of action aimed, whether intentionally or not, at the opposite of good. The name for this trajectory, as opposed to its terminus, is “vice”, a word in Greek distinct from but etymologically related to the word for “evil”. Vice is a concrete manifestation of evil, as concrete goods are a manifestation of the Good.
Although the identification of evil with matter is not equivalent to a denunciation of the body, Plotinus appreciates that embodiment is what makes the allure of evil possible. Following Plato, Plotinus believes that the true human being is a rational subject and that the burden of embodiment makes it easy to forget this instead prompting us to identify ourselves with the subject of bodily desires. To acknowledge that one is hungry is not a vice or an indication that evil has become a destination. But for a multitude of psychological reasons, embodied desires—even those that are ineliminable—can generate a disorienting effect, the result of which is a “self-forgetting” and a new direction in one’s life, the terminus of which is self-dissolution. That is evil.
The translation of the treatise by Sheppard is lucid and suitably simplified for the reader unwilling or unable to struggle with Plotinus’ challenging Greek style.[2] She makes visible the sometimes obscure arguments offered by Plotinus by the editorial practice of bite-sized paragraphing and shortened sentences. Her concise commentary is judicious and well-informed by the contemporary scholarship, leaving open-ended some very deep interpretative problems that could not possibly be resolved within the scope of this slim volume. One problem, in particular, which Sheppard only alludes to on several occasions, is that if matter is evil, how can any person be held responsible for vice, given the identity of persons as immaterial beings? On the one hand, Plotinus is firmly convinced that people must be held morally responsible for their wrongdoing, On the other hand, Plotinus is also faithful to Plato in maintaining that “no one does wrong willingly”, a claim that seems to be reinforced by the identification of matter and evil. Sheppard lays out the problem clearly and gives some useful directions to the secondary literature.
Sheppard’s work is a valuable addition to the continuing series initiated by Dillon and Smith. The treatise I 8 is by no means the only effective way to enter the Plotinian universe, but it is for all that a very good one.
REFERENCES
Lloyd P. Gerson, Plotinus Ennead V.5: That the Intelligibles are not Outside the Intellect, and on the Good. Translation, with an Introduction, and Commentary (Parmenides Publishing, 2013).
Lloyd P. Gerson, Ennead I 8, On What Evils Are and Where They Come From in Plotinus. The Enneads. 2nd edition, edited by Lloyd P. Gerson, (Cambridge University Press, 2025).
[1] The present reviewer is the author of one of these volumes, V 5, That the Intelligibles are not Outside the Intellect, and on the Good (Parmenides Publishing, 2013). According to the numbering of Porphyry, the first “editor” of Plotinus’ works, there are 54 treatises in all grouped into 6 thematic bundles of nine each (hence, each of these bundles is an ennead, the Greek word for “9”). Of the seventeen previous volumes, several include more than one treatise which were actually artificially divided by Porphyry. So, there are somewhat fewer than 36 (54-18) volumes to go in the series.
[2] The present reviewer is also the author of another recent English translation of this treatise in Plotinus. The Enneads. 2nd edition, edited by Lloyd P. Gerson (Cambridge University Press, 2025). Readers may be familiar with a widely used and respected older English translation by A.H. Armstrong. I think that neither Sheppard’s translation nor my own were intended to make Armstrong’s obsolete. Hers and mine serve different purposes from his, especially in the addition of ancillary material.