Thom Brooks offers this slender and skilful volume as an introduction to political philosophy. It would perform admirably as a textbook in an introductory course at the undergraduate level.
The book assumes no prior knowledge of the field and approaches its subject matter topically. Each of the eight substantive chapters is devoted to a theme. These are, in order of appearance: freedom, rights, equality, justice, democracy, punishment, global justice, and climate change. By approaching his subject matter thematically, Brooks is able to move freely among historical periods, in pursuit of productive arguments and ideas. His approach also bridges two traditional (and sometimes oppositional) tendencies in the practice of political philosophy: the first, to undertake political philosophy as a project in moral thought—from the heavens down, as it were; the second, to build insight from the ground up, with heightened sensitivity to the constraints imposed by material conditions, political institutions, and the behavior (coordinated and otherwise) of frequently selfish human actors. Each chapter draws on a variety of perspectives within these traditions, and public-policy examples are used to good effect to illuminate theoretical points. All of this is well done. It’s no mean feat to shift between abstract political theory and the minutiae of contemporary climate policy.
Since the book is marketed as a textbook, instructors will likely want to know about its success on the following counts, presented in the order in which they occurred to me, and not in terms of their intrinsic importance: 1. Will it give students a good grounding in the discipline and equip them for more advanced coursework in political philosophy? 2. Is it fun to read, or, at least, engaging? 3. Does it cover this critically important topic/debate/thinker (insert topic/debate/thinker of concern)? My answers, for those too time-pressed to read on, are: yes, yes (with caveats), and it depends.
(1) Foundations
On the first count, it’s worth noting that, by proceeding topically, starting with core concepts like freedom, rights, equality, and justice, and closing with an applied treatment of climate change, the book has a strikingly similar structure to many introductory courses in political philosophy. This sensitivity to existing practice will make it very useful to anyone confronted by the daunting task of teaching an introduction to political philosophy for the first time. It provides the spine and much of the meat of a very creditable course.
Brooks gives pride of place to the ideas and their motivations. The chapter on equality, for example, draws out the different ways in which equality might matter to people—and a variety of philosophical positions are deftly and organically woven in with the everyday concerns that motivate them (from money, to luck, status, formal rights, welfare, and so forth). This approach has clear advantages, as well as some (entirely defensible) costs. In his work to synthesize and translate historical source material, Brooks achieves a flowing dialectic, and ensures the contemporary legibility of ideas, but students will sometimes miss out on distinctive features of the discourse: Nozick’s Wilt Chamberlain case becomes “the example of a celebrity from the early 1970s when he was writing” (115), for example. That said, as students follow each lead in Brooks’s fast-paced inquiry, they are likely to learn a much more important skill, namely, how to think like a political philosopher.
The book’s chapters are a manageable length for undergraduate assignment. They range from 15-35 pages and are subdivided into sections (e.g., in the rights chapter, there are distinct subsections dealing with taxonomy, human rights, the capabilities approach, and so forth)—some of which could be neatly excerpted if reading length becomes an issue. Each chapter concludes with a short list of suggested readings, which might also be profitably plundered in the name of supplementation. One common textbook feature that is missing, and that might be worth adding to future editions, is a list of potential discussion questions at the end of each chapter.
(2) Engagement
Moving to the second ground of evaluation: how engaging is the book likely to be for students in an increasingly demanding attention economy?
Philosophical works seem to fare better among a novice undergraduate readership if they are: (1) written in a clear, contemporary voice; (2) peppered with engaging and relatable examples; and (3) able to challenge received wisdom in ways that students find provocative. Happily, the prose in this book is clear and accessible, and connections between ideas and traditions are clearly drawn. So, count (1) a victory. And, since this book surveys many controversial ideas—some of them, like the divine right of kings, simply outrageous—we can count (3) amply satisfied as well. As for (2), although the book is deeper and more detailed at points than potential competitors, such as Jonathan Wolff’s An Introduction to Political Philosophy, or Michael Sandel’s Justice, it’s perhaps not as entertainingly written. Wolff opens with an attention-grabbing scene from the Lord of the Flies and plunges straight into the state of nature. Sandel starts with a hurricane and the blood-pressure raising issue of price-gouging. Brooks, by contrast, kicks things off in the chapter on freedom with reference to a phrase in the American Declaration of Independence, before diving into several pages on the question of free will, which he addresses via Kant and Hegel (a distinctive choice—I wondered if some students might struggle to connect the terms of this debate to the questions of political freedom occupying the rest of the chapter). At any rate, lest this discussion verge into matters of individual stylistic and pedagogical preference, it’s important to emphasize that, in general, the book is very clearly written and accessible, and that students are likely to find it very helpful indeed.
(3) Coverage
Finally, let us turn to the third criterion. I know from my own experience of intrusive thoughts while thumbing textbooks, and from lending a sympathetic ear to the impassioned wails of colleagues, that one of the most difficult aspects of committing to teach someone else’s synoptic treatment of the classic questions of one’s beloved subdiscipline is accepting the judgment of another mind about which questions, thinkers, and topics should be left on the cutting-room floor. Brooks is wide-ranging in his engagement with the canon, and it would be unfair to insist on comprehensiveness in a book this short, especially given its admirable focus on the clear and unfussy introduction of key ideas.
Brooks is also quite clear that the book is written from a point of view, and that its composition reflects his preferences. Indeed, one of the nicely engaging features of the book is that, far from striving for impartiality or anonymity, Brooks often connects debates to his own scholarly work (for example, devoting the conclusion of the chapter on justice to his own account of “justice as stakeholding” (125-128)).
Even so, it’s worth noting that certain important topics or thinkers do not figure, since people may assign the book in a variety of philosophical environments, where it may be more or less important that an introductory text contain such content. Marx, for example, receives only two fleeting references in the main text. Some more recent figures like Hayek, Weber, Foucault, Fanon, Habermas, and Arendt do not appear at all. And feminist philosophy makes quite a limited appearance. It figures briefly in a subsection of the chapter on justice (122-125) (where Brooks touches on classic debates about pornography, sex work, and polygamy), and, less explicitly, through Brooks’s engagement with Martha Nussbaum’s oeuvre. I couldn’t find substantive engagement with more recent debates in feminist political philosophy, the philosophy of gender, or, indeed, the political philosophy of race (although debates about multiculturalism and cosmopolitanism do figure).
Since we’re on the topic of transmitting the canon, I’ll close by mentioning an episode that I found striking in the democracy chapter; perhaps more as a curious sign of the times than anything else. While discussing popular representation, Brooks considers different systems of voting, including first-past-the-post and preferential approaches (139-142). Then, he expresses hope that technological advances will lead to the innovation of new voting systems—that AI, often viewed as a threat to democracy, may, in this respect at least, prove an asset. He continues:
After typing this sentence, I asked ChatGPT if it could identify new ways of voting. One of these suggested I will call a points-based voting system. This might work in the following way. Voters each get points (for example, five points). They can then distribute these points to candidates at an election however they like. Suppose I have five points and five candidates. One option is that I could choose to give five points to a single candidate…After all voters have distributed their share of points, we add up the points awarded by voters for each candidate. The winner is the candidate with the most points… AI has the potential to help us see processes in new ways that could revolutionize how we do politics in a manner still unimaginable at this time. (I would not have thought to include this alternative if it were not for it). (142-143)
The first thing to note here is that this is not a new suggestion. It describes the established practice of “cumulative voting”. For those thinking of adopting it for departmental matters, see Robert’s Rules of Order Newly Revised (12th ed. 46:43). The second thing to observe is that this passage amply demonstrates what a mixed blessing the new technology looks to be. We are living in uncertain times. The work of pedagogy is likely to become harder. The scholarly resources on which we rely face serious threats of corruption as well as happier possibilities of enhancement. In such a context, books like the one under review—books by accomplished scholars, that offer a humane, thoughtful, and tested means of introducing students to philosophy—are likely to prove increasingly vital resources, assuming that we are wise enough to employ them.
REFERENCES
Robert, Henry M., III, Daniel H. Honemann, Thomas J. Balch, Daniel E. Seabold, and Shmuel Gerber. Robert’s Rules of Order Newly Revised. 12th ed. New York: PublicAffairs, 2020.
Sandel, Michael J. Justice: What’s the Right Thing to Do? New York: Farrar, Straus and Giroux, 2009.
Wolff, Jonathan. An Introduction to Political Philosophy. 3rd ed. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2016.