Reflecting on the Italian fascism of his childhood some 60 years prior, Umberto Eco remarks that “behind a regime and its ideology there is always a way of thinking and feeling, a group of cultural habits, of obscure instincts and unfathomable drives” (1995). Allen Buchanan’s Political Tribalism: How it Hijacks Our Minds and Diminishes our Humanity picks up Eco’s thread in more ways than one. Buchanan’s subject is growing social and political division, especially in the contemporary American context (20-21). Political relations have become so much more antagonistic. Civility and toleration of disagreement (supposing they were genuinely present to begin with) have given way to incendiary rhetoric and physical violence carried out for political aims.
Why is this happening? Buchanan answers by appealing to precisely the sub-rational features to which Eco draws our attention: the “way of thinking and feeling”, the set of “habits”, “obscure instincts”, and the motivations that lead people to make politics antagonistic. His answer is, in short, that people are going tribal. More precisely, tribalistic political ideologies that inhibit the moral and cognitive capacities of persons are spreading, and this is what explains growing political antagonism.
Buchanan’s argument draws on his experience thinking about issues as varied as social epistemology, institutional legitimacy, and evolutionary human biology to deliver his explanation. It starts with the idea of tribalism, which is a specific kind of political ideology (32-33). Ideologies in general are evaluative, action-guiding maps of the social world (33). Such maps orient individuals’ thinking about politics and society, guiding them in what to believe, who to associate with, and what views to hold about the legitimacy and use of power, among other functions. While any ideology in this broad sense will categorize persons in a shared social setting, tribalistic ideologies are distinctive in instilling an extreme and antagonistic division between one’s in-group and out-groups (33). The extreme division between groups that tribalistic ideologies portray have deep moral and cognitive repercussions for those who internalize such ideologies.
Morally, tribalistic ideologies impede individuals’ moral reasoning primarily by representing politics as a zero-sum struggle of life and death on which one’s existence and identity depend (52-53). By representing politics as a condition of high-stakes group conflict, such ideologies are supposed to motivate transgression of what would otherwise be seen as moral norms in one’s behavior toward those that one views as Other.
Cognitively, tribalistic ideologies undermine our ability to reason about and with persons perceived as Other because such ideologies represent the other in terms of rigid stereotypes which obscure differences among persons falling within that category (36-37), impede one’s ability to take the perspective of persons deemed Other (45-47), and impede uptake of testimony from persons regarded as Other (80-81). Tribalistic ideologies’ effects on our moral reasoning compound with those cognitive effects, transforming what should be truth-seeking discourse into interactions aimed at defensive scorekeeping against opposition criticism (rather than fair consideration of and response to such criticism) and exercises in signaling one’s group affiliation and sorting one’s interactions to take place with one’s group (62-5).
Tribalism, then, is that way of thinking and feeling, of seeing and desiring and reacting, that is the driving force behind the antagonism observed in contemporary politics. After developing it, Buchanan relies on the account to provide an interpretation of recent political events (such as the U.S.’s COVID-19 response on pages 87-95), an interpretation of how social media interacts with individual identity construction to result in the expression and exacerbation of tribalism (Ch. 6), and to discuss how tribalism causes the erosion of democracy (Ch. 4). These are just some of the major claims raised, not to mention a variety of fascinating secondary claims, such as an account of ideology and umwelt, or reality as one experiences it (41-45), among others.
Fitting for a scholar with the breadth of contributions in various debates that Buchanan has made, Political Tribalism engages in several activities at once. It is first and foremost an explanatory project in social and political philosophy, but beyond that it is a political commentary, evolutionary hypothesis, and a personal reflection. Here, I will focus primarily on the main aim of the project, which is the explanatory account.
Explanations answer questions. Buchanan offers a series of questions that he proposes his account will answer, ranging from “Why are politicians today so prone to lie, cheat, and engage in such nasty attacks on their opponents?” to “What happened to the idea of the common good?” (19). Though he does not say so explicitly, based on the cases and examples that are his focus, I gather that the questions are directed at contemporary politics: why have the observed behaviors been increasing as of late?
Compelling answers to such questions will have to do two things. First, the answer itself must consist of a plausibly sound reason, appeal to which is sufficient for showing why the target of explanation obtains. Secondly, the answer will need to be accompanied with a further contextual account which shows why the preceding reason has obtained only in the period where the primary target of explanation occurs. While Buchanan’s tribalistic ideology account seems to me a compelling candidate for achieving the former, I was left uncertain about whether his account succeeds in the latter aim. Why is it that tribalistic ideologies are emerging, or becoming especially prominent, in recent politics? So far as I can tell, Buchanan offers no answer to this question.
At times, his discussion of persons’ propensities for internalizing tribalistic ideologies turns on general evolutionary explanations of persons’ cognitive capacities (141-143), but such evolutionary explanations are too broad. Those evolved capacities could not have changed in the past few years, so why is it that tribalism has been on the rise lately? More generally, why did tribalistic ideologies that Buchanan identifies as causes of contemporary social and political antagonism arise? What is distinctive about present social and political circumstances that makes explanation in terms of a particular collective social psychological phenomenon apt? These are central questions for this kind of explanatory project. Without answers to them, we have no basis for holding that tribalistic ideologies are the key variable of explanation, rather than a merely dependent variable that is affected by an unstated, or unknown, confounding cause that also affects the variables in which the tribalistic ideology is proposed as an explanation.
And there do seem to be alternative candidate explanations on the table. One alternative is to focus on elites as driving social and political events. On this view, persons predominantly defer to elite direction, and so we need only to explain what drives elite decision-making, rather than attribute to individuals a shift in their psychology to a tribalistic ideology. Michael Parenti, for example, conjectures that, similar to many Germans in the 1930s,
Since many “middle Americans” already obey the law, pay their taxes, give their sons to the army, are themselves distrustful of political heterodoxy, and applaud when unions are broken and troublesome people are disposed of, they probably could live without too much personal torment in a fascist state. (1996, 33-34)
This sort of explanation emphasizes the banality of evil, the ease with which persons can “go Nazi” just by a change of direction in leadership.
Another kind of explanation is one based on social structural considerations. Marxist theories of social conflict and division, specifically fascism, see such pathologies as outgrowths of inequality within capitalist economies. On Leon Trotsky’s account, capital accumulation and material inequality create the conditions of economic destitution and desperation that drive persons into the ranks of fascist parties, ready to inflict violence on perceived enemies (1993). Here, the explanans is an institutional structure, capitalist economy, and tribalistic ideology, to the extent that it is present, is one of the effects to be understood in terms of that explanans.
I do not know whether these alternative accounts are true, and I don’t raise them to suggest that they are. Rather, I take them to illustrate some of the different kinds of explanations that can be pursued for reaching an understanding about Buchanan’s target phenomenon. How should we adjudicate between different candidate explanatory avenues? Our answer will be informed by our motives for raising the pertinent question in the first place. On this point, Buchanan’s discussion is explicit: his “main motivation wasn’t intellectual curiosity, a desire to find out the truth about tribalism”. Rather, his main motives were “a toxic combination of fear, disgust, and alienation, pushing [Buchanan] toward despair”, which left him thinking, “I can no longer recognize the country I live in” (170). Such personal reflections are a deep part of Political Tribalism, with Buchanan relying with some regularity on his experience in recent interpersonal interactions and his upbringing in Jim Crow Arkansas (9-10, 46, 62, 66, 91-92, and 165-166, among others).
This is an eminently compelling and understandable motivation. Buchanan sees social and political life becoming something vicious, and he wants to know why that is happening. His explanatory focus is drawn to other people, highlighted by salient recent personal interactions. This is a natural reaction. We normally do seek to make the behavior of others intelligible to ourselves, to find a way in which we can make sense of them. If society and politics is changing, it’s compelling to extend that appetite for interpersonal intelligibility and find something about people that has changed, something in their minds, in their psychology, that has been transformed. If politics is characterized by greater antagonism and conflict, something must be driving people to feel that aggression is warranted, some kind of a supreme emergency that requires the suspension of moral norms that were otherwise adhered to (70-72). But is seeking the interpersonal intelligibility of others’ behavior the right way to find the truth about large-scale social and political phenomena?
It is not clear to me that the best explanation of social and political phenomena will be one that must accord with the self-conceptions and interpersonal understandings of the persons who constitute the phenomena being explained. Have Americans really undergone a significant psychological transformation, or are most of them continuing with business as usual, deferring to the direction of opportunistic elites to whom their loyalty has already been cemented by an unreflective partisan affiliation? Is social media a site of identity-anxiety that instigates tribalistic behavior, or have social media platforms developed fine-tuned algorithms that expose users to content that stimulates negative emotions which best increase engagement for the sake of maximizing profits? Buchanan focuses on something that is naturally compelling and meaningful to us, the psychology of others. But it may be that the things that matter to us, the terms in which we make sense of ourselves and others, fail to track the truth of why social phenomena take the course that they do. This, after all, is the traditional role of ideology in critical theory, which was to explain why the structures of society induce persons to act systematically against their interests. The psychology of individuals was, on such approaches, an effect of the real cause.
So long as such alternatives are live options, Buchanan’s account is at most one compelling hypothesis among others. I am left with the view that Buchanan’s Political Tribalism is a philosophically informed, intellectually multi-faceted reflection on the present condition of American society and politics. But the truth of the explanatory account contained within it, and the means by which we could determine that truth, are, I think, yet to be worked out, and perhaps are beyond those of us living through these times.
REFEERENCES
Eco, Umberto. 1995. “Ur-Fascism.” The New York Review of Books, June 22.
Parenti, Michael. 1996. Dirty Truths. City Lights Books.
Trotsky, Leon. 1993. Fascism: What It Is and How to Fight It. Pathfinder Press.