Tuomo Tiisala’s Power and Freedom in the Space of Reasons: Elaborating Foucault’s Pragmatism (PFSR) is a book that is simultaneously inspired and dispiriting. Tiisala’s offering is one of the most sustained efforts to date in bringing Michel Foucault’s philosophical insights into conversation with the riches of analytical philosophy. Tiisala has mastered a number of important tendencies in both recent analytical philosophy as well as in the dense thickets of Foucault’s own philosophical investigations. He has also mastered systematic philosophical perspectives as seemingly disparate as those of Robert Brandom’s rationalist pragmatism and Foucault’s philosophical archaeology. This mastery of multiple approaches to systematic philosophy tees up a number of philosophical interventions that readers will find most interesting. Surely the standout among Tiisala’s interpretive insights is that Foucault’s archaeology can be understood anew according to Brandom’s rationalist pragmatist account of how our use of concepts is always structured by rules of practice that often remain implicit within conceptual use but which a rational project of self-understanding can make explicit on the basis of nothing more than the very same inherited conceptual apparatus whose implicit practical presuppositions have become an object of explication.
The book’s major new reinterpretation of Foucault is no small scholarly footnote—archaeology was the methodological center of Foucault’s philosophy from roughly 1961 to 1970 during the years of his rise to philosophical pre-eminence. After this period, Foucault developed a methodological approach for which he is today much better known—the philosophical genealogy characteristic of his work from roughly 1973 until his death in 1984. According to one cartoonish picture still too commonly purveyed, Foucault abandoned archaeology in 1970 and arrived at genealogy by 1973. But no serious scholar of Foucault now defends this view.[1] The consensus is that genealogy constitutes an expansion of archaeological method. This expansionist interpretation was best encapsulated by Tiisala’s mentor Arnold Davidson in a 1986 article: “genealogy does not so much displace archaeology as widen the kind of analysis to be pursued”.[2]
For any reader convinced by the expansionist account of Foucault’s methodological transformations, a subtle omission in Tiisala’s interpretation will assume glaring proportions. In accounting for Foucault’s philosophical investigations, what came after 1970 matters much too. Yet Tiisala grants only the most passing of notice to discussion of genealogy as a feature of Foucault’s philosophical critique. He focuses almost entirely on archaeological method.
Tiisala’s neglect of genealogy is conceptually connected to a second omission in his presentation that also at first appears only as a dim glimmer and yet grows blindingly bright as the argument unfolds. Despite Tiisala’s impressive grasp of the nuances of Brandom’s complicated formulation of a linguistic pragmatism, he declines to discuss (and indeed does not even mention) alternative conceptions of pragmatism to Brandom’s.[3]
These two omissions taken together will leave many readers somewhat dispirited.[4] The inspired interpretation of Foucault advanced in the book ends up tethering Foucault to the philosophical restrictions of linguistic philosophy without seriously considering the challenge already mounted to such an approach decades ago in Foucault’s own shift from the archaeology of the discursive conditions of knowledge to the genealogy of the practical conditions of power-knowledge. Foucault toured through the linguistic turn long before Brandom. More importantly, he navigated his way out of the lost trails of language-centric philosophy while Brandom remains firmly planted on a plane of linguistic idealism. Rather than constituting something like a Brandomian rearticulation of Foucault, the real result of Tiisala’s effort is to show how Brandomian pragmatism is essentially incomplete with respect to what we should expect of pragmatist philosophy, and in a manner that is directly analogous to the incompleteness that Foucault himself came to recognize in his own project of an archaeology of knowledge. In both cases—Brandom’s pragmatism and Foucault’s archaeology (and so by extension Tiisala’s union of the two)—what is lacking is a philosophically capacious conception of practice that is able to avoid the narrowing limits of a philosophical perspective that prioritizes the linguistic. The category of practice ought to be the beating heart of any viable pragmatist philosophy and for the very same reasons that it was a focal concern for Foucault’s philosophical genealogies.
To see just how much it matters that the category of practice is lacking in Tiisala’s account of Foucault, we need to consider both his presentation of Foucauldian archaeology as essentially pragmatist in its architecture and his later extension of that architecture to Foucault’s analytics of power.
Tiisala sources the architecture he attributes to both archaeology and genealogy from Brandom’s rationalist or idealist pragmatism. This Brandomian architecture is explicated most fully in chapter 1. The account is ambitious, complicated, and refreshingly clear. At its core is what Tiisala calls “the pragmatist account of understanding” (PFSR, 10). Tiisala begins with Ludwig Wittgenstein’s rejection of the representationalist theory of concepts (or rules), “according to which understanding consists in representing”, such that concepts, as the elements of understanding, are essentially representations of that which they purport to be about, paradigmatically some aspect of the world (PFSR, 10). Wittgenstein rightly rejected representationalism because it triggers “an infinite hierarchy of representations” in response to a question of how we can ever know we have appropriately understood a given concept (PFSR, 10). This is the philosophically rich “regress of rules” argument in Philosophical Investigations against “the representationalist account of understanding as interpretation” (PFSR, 9).
Tiisala’s label for the nonrepresentational alternative he develops through the idea of “dispositional understanding” is “pragmatism” (PFSR, 9, 10). The heart of this view is that understanding is not a representation installed in the mind (for instance, by a causal mechanism of sensory experience, i.e., the Sellarsian ‘given’) so much as a disposition inculcated in a practitioner “by means of training” (PFSR, 12) and in particular “linguistic training” (PFSR, 17). Understanding is therefore “essentially social” in the sense that any correct use of a concept presupposes a social practice in which a concept-user has been trained (or is being trained): “Every concept user is ontologically dependent on a group of concept users” (PFSR, 19).
Having established the essential sociality of conceptuality, Tiisala then moves from Wittgenstein to Brandom’s account of “semantic self-consciousness” (PFSR, 20–25). The core of this view is that despite the dependence of concept-users on social practices external to their own understanding, they “can nonetheless gain rational control over the given patterns of reasoning and intentionally change them” (PFSR, 20). Concept-users do this through the reflexive practice of making explicit the practical normative statuses that are already implicit in their conceptual activity. The idea of semantic self-consciousness is that of coming into an explicit understanding of the implicit presuppositions of one’s practical mastery in concept use that was acquired by means of training.
Philosophical critique understood as semantic self-consciousness is the master idea at which Tiisala’s argument aims. Semantic self-consciousness is, he argues, central to the exercise of autonomy that is paradigmatically expressed in the work of philosophical critique—a connection articulated in detail in the book’s final chapter 5. The preceding chapters 2–4 apply chapter 1’s pragmatist architecture to Foucault. Having sketched the book’s overall arc, I shall focus this review on the account of Foucault’s archaeology of knowledge presented in chapter 3 and of his analytics of power in chapter 4. These chapters are clearly the heart of the contribution signaled by the book’s title and subtitle.
Chapter 3 presents the category of nonrepresentational dispositional understanding as central to Foucault’s key archaeological category of savoir. This technical term is frequently glossed in the literature as the unstated “depth knowledge” that structures conditions of possibility for the “surface knowledge” or everyday scientific statements Foucault referred to as connaissance. Elaborating on his interpretation of savoir, Tiisala asserts that, “Foucault’s decidedly pragmatist key idea is that the rules of savoir are created, sustained, and sometimes transformed through the very activity of making statement[s] without representing the rules as such” (PFSR, 59). This leads to Tiisala’s claim (employing language from the early Dreyfus and Rabinow book on Foucault) that, at the level of savoir, “rules are simultaneously both implicit and efficacious” (PFSR, 59).
Tiisala’s idea follows Brandom in assuming that the nonrepresentational dispositional understanding that conditions knowing is implicit in a sense that sets it up as already explicit in potentiality. This assumption is at its clearest in Tiisala’s endorsement of “the primacy of discursive practices over nondiscursive practices” (PFSR, 69). Tiisala’s view, like Brandom’s, can be described as construing the implicit as the inexplicit, rather than accommodating the implicit in a broader sense of what agents can and cannot licitly do. The central task of rationality on this picture is to make explicit, or bring into semantic self-consciousness, those implicit rules that are efficacious behind our backs. But why should we not hold that dispositional understanding is sometimes essentially nonlinguistic, and in such cases not capable of explication in any standard sense yet nevertheless quite capable of accommodating the licitness of ruleishness?
Tiisala, just like Brandom before him, does not sufficiently consider whether there might be rules operative behind our backs that are, to be sure, not explicit (because behind our backs) and yet not for that reason amenable to downstream explicit linguistic articulation (that is, implicit in the sense of inexplicit). The dizzyingly difficult methodological question that needs be faced here concerns how we can conceptualize nonlinguistic dispositional understanding as itself essentially social without relying on a notion of nonlinguistic mentalese of the sort that Wittgenstein criticized as a “private language.”[5] I believe this is a question already anticipated by (though clearly not fully formulated within) Foucault’s expansion of his archaeological analytics of knowledge into a richer genealogical analytics of power-knowledge.
The beginnings of an elegant response to this question can be found in the idea that nonlinguistic activities can themselves be normative (i.e., are capable of being correct) in certain practical contexts. Consider normativity at the level of somatic performance: there is a correct way to draw a bow across the strings of the viola or to pitch a baseball such that the correctness at issue is not reducible to linguistic articulation (a musical performance does not consist in stating “now I play Beethoven’s Symphony No. 9” nor can a baseball pitcher strike out the batter by asserting from the mound “now I throw three strikes across the plate”).[6] Or consider normativity in the artifice of technique and technology: there is a correct way to design (as well as fabricate and install) a door handle such that the correctness is not reducible to linguistic description (a designer’s detailed blueprint of a device is rather unhelpfully understood as a visual shorthand for what are in reality linguistic concepts). Consider, finally, a less innocent example taking its bearings from the genealogy in Foucault’s Discipline and Punish: there is a sense of normative correctness (and one not to be confused with the narrow subcategory of ethical normativity) operative where the disciplinarian trains their docile subject in rhythms and rituals of practical performance that are not themselves fully linguistic in any operational sense.
Of course, what I have sketched above is only the beginning of a response to an exceedingly difficult challenge. My aim here is not so much to resolve the challenge as to bring its difficulty into view. For this is precisely the difficulty that gets left out of view where Tiisala attempts to reduce the genealogical method to its archaeological predecessor (rather than, as suggested by the expansionist interpretation, the other way around).
Tiisala applies his Brandomian architecture to Foucault’s analytics of power in chapter 4. What seems plausible with respect to Foucault’s archaeologies manifests as indefensible when it comes to his genealogies. Tiisala provocatively argues that just as archaeology works to make explicit a savoir that consists in the once-implicit rules that govern a system of knowledge, Foucault’s analytics of power works to make explicit the same savoir as the system of once-implicit rules governing a system of power. Here is Tiisala’s clearest statement of this provocative reinterpretation: “Foucault’s widely discussed ideas regarding relations of power and practices of the self can be fully understood only against the background of the distinctive view of savoir that informs archaeology” (PFSR, 55; cf. 82). Fully understood? Really?
Just as Foucault’s archaeology relied on a contrast between the everyday knowledge of connaissance and the implicit system of rules of savoir, Foucault’s genealogy should be understood as involving a similar contrast between the everyday operations of force in the sense of puissance and the implicit system of rules for power that he referred to with his signature concept of pouvoir (which can roughly be summarized as referring to the “depth” conditions of the exercise of power). Tiisala asserts that “Foucault’s diagnostic work probes the implicit level of savoir from two complementary perspectives, focusing on the practices of making truth-claims and practices of governing people, respectively, as well as the connections between them” (PFSR, 92). But more precise, in light of Foucault’s patient elaboration of genealogies of power-knowledge in numerous publications from the 1970s, would be the view that Foucault’s diagnostic work probes the implicit level of savoir from the perspective of knowledge and truth while it probes the implicit level of pouvoir from the perspective of power and government. Depth conditions of knowledge (i.e., savoir) implicitly structure explicit truth claims in the context of, say, the sciences. Depth conditions of power (i.e., pouvoir) implicitly structure the actual maintenance of social order in the context of, say, disciplinary institutions. Crucially, archaeology involves the survey of the rules of a savoir, whilst genealogy involves the survey of the rules of a savoir in their interaction with the quite separate (even if also related) depth rules of pouvoir. Put differently, Foucault typically focused his archaeologies on knowledge and his genealogies on power-knowledge.
Tiisala is surely right that there is a complementary logic common to archaeological and genealogical inquiry—it is a logic that can be summarized as critique in the Kantian sense of inquiry into conditions of possibility. But Tiisala is quite wrong to assert that, in virtue of this common logic, savoir is the common object of archaeology and genealogy alike. This is to commit the mistake of thinking that conditions of practical performance can be fully reduced to conditions of linguistic assertion. But the conditions of correctness in a practice are much more varied than linguistic conditions alone—conditions of practice surely almost always include linguistic conditions, but they also include somatic conditions (of bodily performance), technical conditions (of performance in technique and design), and presumably much else too. Taking Foucault’s Discipline and Punish as an example, the practice of discipline certainly includes linguistic utterances and otherwise overtly semantic material (consider the manuals of disciplinary procedure), but also bodily skills and habits (the dressage of the body), architected structures (the Panopticon), scientific techniques (of normalization), and technological forms (in recordkeeping and documentation).
One cannot but witness in Tiisala’s book an inspired attitude—the unflagging courage of an undiscouraged idealism pursuing the rationality internal to the manifold shapes of the history of human practices. But Foucault was Nietzschean rather than Hegelian (as he himself learned from Deleuze).
Tiisala’s argument relies upon the double neglect of the crucial challenges internal to Foucauldian genealogy and of the insights of a pragmatist philosophy no longer confined to the linguistic. Where genealogy and pragmatism come together (and one should never overstate the extent to which they do), it would be in terms of a pragmatism that would be more capacious than that of linguistic idealism—one such model is offered by the pragmatism of practice, conduct, or action.[7] According to this view, an analytics of human practices requires a methodology willing to hold in view all of the contingent aspects of our practices rather than maintaining a strict focus on only the rational dimensions of practice out of a prior commitment to “the primacy of discursive practices over nondiscursive practices” (PFSR, 69). Taking the wider view surely requires a more enormous effort of work when conducting philosophical investigations. But that, in part, is the point. The real problem with idealism has always been that it pretends to make things much easier than they are. If only we could transform the world by achieving semantic self-consciousness and thereby gaining rational control over our concepts. But Foucault saw through that cunning philosophical temptation. In so doing he crafted a philosophy for the patient work of investigating the actual practices we find ourselves caught in.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
For comments on an earlier draft of this review I thank Leonard D’Cruz and Verena Erlenbusch-Anderson. For numerous discussions of the book under review I thank participants in the University of Oregon’s Critical Genealogies Collaboratory (Abbas Bagwala, Brooke Burns, Gonzalo Bustamante Moya, Asher Caplan, Chelsea Schwartz, and Maia Wellborn).
REFERENCES
Chang, Hasok. 2022. Realism for Realistic People: A New Pragmatist Philosophy of Science. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2022.
Davidson, Arnold. 1986. “Archaeology, Genealogy, Ethics,” in David Hoy (ed.), Foucault: A Critical Reader. Malden: Blackwell.
Dreyfus, Hubert and Paul Rabinow. 1983. Michel Foucault: Beyond Structuralism and Hermeneutics, second edition (first edition published 1982). Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Foucault, Michel. 1969 (orig. pub.). The Archaeology of Knowledge. A. M. Sheridan Smith (trans.). New York: Pantheon, 1972.
Foucault, Michel. 1975 (orig. pub.). Discipline and Punish: The Birth of the Prison. Alan Sheridan (trans.). New York: Vintage Books, 1997.
Koopman, Colin. 2013. Genealogy as Critique: Foucault and the Problems of Modernity. Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
Koopman, Colin. 2014. “Conduct Pragmatism: Pressing Beyond Experientialism and Lingualism,” in European Journal of Pragmatism and American Philosophy VI, no. 2: 145–174.
Koopman, Colin. 2017. “Conceptual Analysis for Genealogical Philosophy: How to Study the History of Practices after Foucault and Wittgenstein,” in The Southern Journal of Philosophy 55, no. S1: 103–121.
Rabinow, Paul. 2011. “Dewey and Foucault: What’s the Problem?,” in Foucault Studies 11: 11–19.
Rabinow, Paul. 2012. “How to Submit to Inquiry: Dewey and Foucault,” in The Pluralist 7, no. 3: 25–37.
Tiisala, Tuomo. 2024. Power and Freedom in the Space of Reasons: Elaborating Foucault’s Pragmatism. New York: Routledge Press.
[1] Yet this does not prevent Tiisala from attributing it to two of Foucault’s most important anglophone philosophical interpreters (and interlocutors), Hubert Dreyfus and Paul Rabinow (PFSR, 55). In the preface to the second edition of their book, published in 1984, Dreyfus and Rabinow clearly state their view that Foucault’s work in the 1970s enriched his archaeological method by enveloping the archaeology of knowledge in the broader and more complicated project of a genealogy of power-knowledge. Dreyfus and Rabinow write of “Foucault’s work during the seventies” that it develops “a new method” that “combines a type of archaeological analysis which preserves the distancing effect of structuralism, and an interpretive dimension which develops the hermeneutic insight that the investigator is always situated” (1983, xii; from “Preface” to the second edition).
[2] Davidson 1986, 227; see my further discussion in Koopman 2013, 30-44.
[3] There is no discussion of the classical pragmatisms of John Dewey, Charles Sanders Peirce, or William James. There is no discussion of more contemporary linguistic pragmatisms that in important respects diverge from Brandom’s, most pointedly those of Richard Rorty and Huw Price. Nor is there any discussion of more political pragmatisms such as Cornel West’s prophetic pragmatism, which West of course explicitly connects to Foucault’s genealogy.
[4] A third and even more dispiriting omission is perhaps less philosophical in nature and more scholarly in its concerns, so I relegate it to a footnote. But it needs be noted that the book appears under-developed with respect to the scholarly labor of triangulating its interpretative innovations with extant scholarship. In numerous passages, Tiisala claims that he is the first to work out some philosophical puzzle about Foucault that in truth has been written about by many others before: “there are no attempts…” (2); “none of the sympathetic interpreters…” (55); “Foucault’s interpreters have widely failed to grasp… ” (65); “even in the most detailed discussions of Foucault’s critique, there is no adequate, or even any, account of…” (98). Just a few of the Foucault scholars that Tiisala declines to engage on these topics (the methodology of critique, archaeological method, the relation of discourse to practice, the object of critique) include Stuart Elden, Mark G.E. Kelly, and (though I am not in a good position to say so authoritatively) myself. Particularly puzzling in light of Tiisala’s forceful critique of the early Rabinow and Dreyfus book (see note 1 above) is that he neither discusses nor even cites Rabinow’s more recent articles on Foucauldian critique and Deweyan pragmatism (2011, 2012).
[5] The final clause distinguishes the genealogical view from arguments for what Tiisala elsewhere calls “a predisursive foundation of experience” (PFSR, 67). Implicit dispositional (and nonlinguistic) understanding can be regulative in practice without being foundational—and in the same way that implicit linguistic understanding can be regulative without being foundational.
[6] To be sure, there are numerous details involved in this challenge and its solution that lie beyond the scope of this paper. A full presentation is one which I continue to work out. An interim presentation of this argument can be found in Koopman (2017), published in a special issue alongside an earlier version of Tiisala’s chapter 5.
[7] On conduct pragmatism see Koopman (2014) and the related view of Chang (2022).