Blain Neufeld claims that public reason makes possible political autonomy in a pluralistic society. His starting point is an ideal of democratic freedom inspired by Rousseau. Freedom is not the absence of restrictions on whatever one happens to want, but to be the author of one’s own life, actively shaping it according to one’s own reasoning. Equal realization of autonomy requires laws regulating how we treat one another, so it also requires that legislation result from collective deliberation in which each can participate as an equal. This autonomy is threatened by the fact that even people fully able and willing to reason with each other will persist in espousing conflicting religious and philosophical doctrines. The solution is public reason.
Chapter 1 reconstructs Rawls’s theory of a merely political form of liberalism, focusing on the ideal of public reason. The central element of public reason is the “criterion of reciprocity” (Rawls 1996, xlii), which demands that political decisions be based on reasons that other citizens could reasonably accept despite adhering to conflicting religious and philosophical doctrines. When justified by public reasons, the basic structure of one’s society can count as self-imposed. Public reason also helps guard against domination of minority groups and realizes civic friendship.
Neufeld’s main theoretical innovation is the explanation given in Chapter 2 of how public reason makes citizens a collective agent. We can be said to intend to do something together when we each intend to do the thing in question (e.g., hosting a party) in a way that is contingent on and responsive to others’ participation (Bratman 2014). One important type of shared intention is a “self-governing policy” (53), according to which a group (e.g., a hiring committee) intends for specific considerations to have weight in its deliberations. Public reason is a particular type of self-governing policy, one that makes citizens a “civic people” animated by “civic respect” (54).
It may be objected that other self-governing policies would serve this purpose, for example, that of deciding democratically and respecting basic rights but not otherwise restricting admissible reasons. Neufeld’s response is that deliberation without public reason doesn’t fully realize political autonomy and is less likely to be stable. Alternatively, citizens might adopt the policy of not having any common rule unless it is unanimously accepted (among reasonable points of view) that the law in question is superior to no law at all. Against this “convergence” model of public justification (63), Neufeld argues that citizens will not be able to know whether any given law is acceptable to all reasonable points of view, each based on its own overall system of beliefs and values.
It may also be objected that citizens cannot have the interdependence of intention that is evident in small-scale examples of friends and committees. Neufeld's response is that the duty of public reason falls first on public officials; that the demands of public reason apply only to a limited set of fundamental political questions; that civic peoplehood requires only that some minimum proportion of citizens be committed to public reason; and that when this threshold is not reached, citizens have a natural duty to promote public reasoning, thereby helping to create a civic people.
Chapter 3 reconceives the relationship between public reason and ideal theory. Many believe that political philosophy should focus on resolving concrete problems here and now, rather than elaborating models of ideally just societies located in some far-off future. Public reason, however, is indeed a response to a real problem in the here and now, namely the problem of how to live on terms of mutual respect with people we disagree with deeply, in the context of an association that is involuntary and coercive. Neufeld claims that so long as one accepts the criterion of reciprocity, one becomes committed to idealization. General compliance is built into public reason because the point is to find terms of association that are universally acceptable so long as generally complied with.
Chapter 4 takes up the question of the scope of the basic structure of society, and whether political liberalism is compatible with justice for women and children. G.A. Cohen has argued that Rawls cannot fully integrate the family into the basic structure as urged by Susan Okin (Okin 1989, 2004) without undermining his claim that justice applies only to the basic structure. (Rawls said “primarily,” not ‘only’ (Rawls 1999, 3, 6), but he also suggested that the difference principle applied only to “macro” questions of public policy (Rawls 1974, 142)). If the basic structure includes only coercive rules, then it excludes gender norms that have a powerful influence on people’s life chances, but if it includes non-coercive rules, then principles of justice also apply to legally-unconstrained personal choices, because that’s where social norms live (Cohen 1997, 17–24). Neufeld denies that there is any such a dilemma, because the basic structure includes whatever aspects of whatever institutions it needs to include, in order to realize citizens’ freedom and equality. Even if sexist norms are not enforced by law, their existence can affect what rules and policies equal opportunity requires, in the domain of childcare and family leave, for example.
Chapter 5 focuses on the implications of political liberalism for education. Education for politically liberal citizenship involves no commitment to emancipating people from the shackles of tradition or religious authority, but it does involve teaching citizens that reasonable persons need not all agree about important religious, philosophical, and ethical questions, and that we should show respect for citizens we disagree with by trying to make (fundamental) political decisions on the basis of public reasons. This spirit of toleration can conflict with the goal of emancipation. Education for democratic autonomy is therefore not equivalent to education for comprehensive ethical autonomy, though there is some overlap. Politically liberal civic education is also consistent with education for non-domination, so long as republican liberty is conceived of in political terms.
Neufeld’s political vision is attractive, but is it sufficiently realistic? If we must assess whether proposed reasons are acceptable to all reasonable comprehensive doctrines, Neufeld’s objection to convergence models of public justification (that it will be difficult to determine whether a proposed law is preferable to no-law according to each reasonable comprehensive view’s total balance of reasons) also seems to apply to consensus models. Neufeld would likely deny that we need to verify this unanimous acceptability, on the ground that public reasons are not derived from the overlap of reasonable comprehensive doctrines but taken from ideas implicit in “public political culture” (13–14). What this amounts to, I think, is that acceptance of particular reasons as public is a criterion for a view to count as fully reasonable, which puts greater argumentative load on the definition of reasonableness.
A closely related challenge is whether citizens could be committed to public reason, and know this, in a proportion sufficient to generate the desired kind of civic relation. It may be that below the relevant threshold there is a natural duty to promote public reason, as there is a natural duty to help create just institutions. Yet the two are disanalogous in that the cost of public reason is not primarily a personal cost, but the cost of not being able to appeal to reasons one thinks true and politically relevant simply because some citizens wrongly but reasonably disagree. In so far as that constraint ends up affecting our choice of policy, that’s a cost on everyone, from my own point of view. It’s one thing to accept mutual concessions for the sake of having a respectful relationship, but another, perhaps, to do so for the sake of potentially having such a relationship in the future. A partial solution may be to recognize that when I participate in political decision-making, the effects of my choices are mediated by law and policy, and so affect everyone, including those who now accept public reason. As for those who reject public reason, I may have sufficient assurance of compliance with the laws chosen even if many citizens are not complying with their ethical duties as legislators. Public reason may thus be binding for relational reasons even in low-compliance scenarios, and not simply as part of a creative duty to help transform society.
A more fundamental objection to Neufeld’s account of public reason is that collective autonomy may not be necessary for individual autonomy. The threat that decision-making based on non-public reasons poses to collective autonomy seems clear enough. Without the constraint of public reason, a society may act based on opposed ideals, from one moment to the next, across different institutions, or levels of government. Of course, we all have desires that conflict in practice, given limited time and resources, but it’s more problematic to be committed to fundamentally opposed values or principles. Such a person is not really one person, we may think. By the same logic, a society that lurches between policies motivated by conflicting ideals and beliefs is not really a collective agent. Still, how does a lack of collective agency make me any less autonomous as an individual? The answer can’t be that my autonomy requires my agreement, because the justification of democracy from autonomy assumes it doesn’t. I am free (or at least freer) in obeying the law not because it matches my preferences but because I participated as an equal in the collective deliberation that shaped the law. If that’s right, the argument for public reason depends on the value of political community, rather than the value of individual autonomy.
REFERENCES
Bratman, Michael. 2014. Shared Agency: A Planning Theory of Acting Together. Oxford University Press.
Cohen, G. A. 1997. “Where the Action Is: On the Site of Distributive Justice.” Philosophy and Public Affairs 26 (1): 3–30.
Okin, Susan Moller. 1989. Justice, Gender, and the Family. New York: Basic Books.
———. 2004. “Justice and Gender: An Unfinished Debate.” Fordham Law Review 72: 1537–67.
Rawls, John. 1974. “Some Reasons for the Maximin Criterion.” American Economic Review 64 (2): 141–46.
———. 1996. Political Liberalism. New York: Columbia University Press.
———. 1999. A Theory of Justice. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.