Race, Time, and Utopia: Critical Theory and the Process of Emancipation

William M. Paris’s first book makes wide-ranging and consequential interventions into contemporary critical theory, Africana philosophy, and critical philosophy of race. By situating careful studies of five key thinkers of black liberation within a synthetic critical framework of his own, Paris is able simultaneously to develop a compelling ‘utopian’ answer to critical theory’s ongoing search for the normative sources of social transformation, offer novel interpretations of his primary interlocutors as contributors to a tradition of utopian critical theory and practice, and illustrate the relevance of the social ontology of time to critical philosophy of race.

Utopia can be a tough sell. Paris’s first achievement is to have renovated the concept of utopia within a framework that builds on and synthesizes Rahel Jaeggi’s concept of forms of life, Ernst Bloch’s thinking on social temporality and asynchrony, and Rainer Forst’s theories of justification and power. A signal debate in Frankfurt critical theory over the last two generations has been about the normative sources of critique and social transformation. The prevailing position holds that critique must be immanent such that we can effectively criticize our societies by drawing on the insufficiency of norms or values already present within our social practices. Typically, immanent critique is mobilized against utopianism, which appears to appeal to ungrounded normative standards cooked up by the utopian imagination.

On Paris’s view, however, utopias are neither transcendent to our socio-historically located forms of life nor straightforwardly immanent to them. Instead, utopian critique and practice finds its normative sources in what Bloch had termed the “non-synchronous”, the unrealized remainders of past social struggles which can be intuitively accessed and provide anticipatory insight into social problems and their potential resolutions (46-49). The justification narratives of any given political hegemony involve a selective sedimentation of inheritances, predicated on suppressing counter-inheritances. Utopianism indexes a kind of critical estrangement from the narratively synchronous present through the re-activation of suppressed or ‘failed’ inheritances and their visions of the future.

The book’s second significant achievement is to figure modern racial domination as racial fetishism. Racial fetishism is a normatively laden practical stance or “social form of consciousness” (147), according to which race has an ‘as if’ reality. By distinguishing between racism and racial fetishism, Paris theorizes the practical persistence of racial domination after the debunking and widespread rejection of biological race theories. On Paris’s developed view, the racially differentiated, social organization of life chances and horizons of expectation appear, through the inverting prism of racial fetishism, to be caused by race, while it is actually a veiled effect of capital accumulation’s tendency to hierarchically differentiate the working class (20, 193-98). The utopian struggle against racial domination is consequently a struggle against the capitalist organization of social time in view of the overcoming of the inheritance of racial fetishism.

The primary themes of race, time, and utopia meet in the concept of non-synchrony, as black liberation struggle is interpreted as drawing its normative source from the non-synchrony of racialized life, which is both the anchor of racial domination and the cause of a normative “gap” that accounts for the distinctive ethical character of the struggles of the racially dominated. Over five chapters, Paris elucidates an increasingly concrete vision of the utopian politics of the non-synchronous as they are developed in the work of several major Africana figures.

The first chapter presents Paris’s model of social change and argues for the role of ‘utopian’ consciousness in transforming societies. Building on Jaeggi and Forst, Paris argues that social consciousness is always located relative to a form of life and its constrained horizons of normative and functional expectations. He contrasts this view with the “awareness model”, according to which it suffices for agents to be aware of and morally incensed by social injustices for them to be committed to social transformation, stressing the role of not only moral but also practical functional normativity in conditioning change.

On Paris’s view, social transformation requires a conjunction of four conditions: the advent of an objective crisis that disrupts practical life, the subjective experience of this disruption as a crisis in horizons of expectation, the emergence of a utopian consciousness that anticipates resolutions to objective crises, and finally, structural conditions that render the costs of remaining in crisis higher than the costs of attempting to break with the status quo and organize new institutions and forms of life. Paris convincingly demonstrates the explanatory value of this framework by applying it to the 2020 George Floyd uprising, arguing that while it involved both a genuine objective crisis and a timely synchronization of both crisis and utopian consciousness, projects to institutionally realize the utopian content of the uprising have remained tragically stalled amidst a broader crisis of “a social form of life in which few people believe” but lack “the structural capacity” to overhaul (54).

Paris turns, in the second chapter, to locate a more inchoate and fragile utopianism in W. E. B. Du Bois. Focusing primarily on The Souls of Black Folk, Paris extracts a social ontology of time from Du Bois’ early work. Phenomenologically, the key Du Boisian concept of the ‘color line’ fractures the social experience of time as racially differentiated forms of life “become oriented toward divergent horizons of expectation” (81). Normatively, racialization and the historical experience of enslavement and struggle have rendered African Americans “non-synchronous with ‘Western’ civilization” and “disposed them toward a different vision of freedom than what was on offer from the broader society of the United States” (64).

The color line has both epistemological and practical consequences. Epistemologically, it obscures black life and inhibits the development of harmonious processes of social justification. Practically, it distorts the range of economic opportunities and life choices available to African Americans. Du Bois famously appeals to the elite and educated talented tenth to develop the cognitive and cultural conditions requisite to addressing the damage wrought by the color line. Problematically, however, if dominant Western culture and learning is afflicted with racist distortions, then any attempt by the talented tenth to transmit the accomplishments of this culture to the black masses will be self-undermining.

Paris creatively argues that Du Bois’s awareness of this issue tempers his widely acknowledged elitism, which is alloyed with a tentative utopianism that appears in his invocation of “sorrow songs”, which “carry…intimations of forms of life that preceded the modern color line and thus introduce a possibly productive form of non-synchronicity into the education of the Talented Tenth” (91). The utopian insight that can guide the transformation of black life beyond the limited horizon of synchronization with white society is thus partially a product of the very asynchrony that the color line reproduces. According to this reading, the task of the talented tenth is not to “rule from their own wisdom” exclusively, but instead to “refin[e] and elucid[ate] the [utopian] message embedded in the music of the black folk” (95, 93). Just what this utopian message is and how it can be realized is, however, left open.

The third chapter turns to black nationalism in search of a more concrete utopianism, interpreting this tradition as the search for a black counterpublic “space of reasons.” Engaging with Martin Delany and Marcus Garvey, Paris argues that black nationalism diagnoses the anchoring of the non-synchrony that characterizes the diminished rights and life chances of the racially dominated in the boundaries of the national community. If the nation’s necessarily exclusive form creates “conditions of possibility for agents to consider themselves as the type of people who can engage in public reason” (106), then black subjects of white supremacist polities may formally possess rights. But, owing to their exclusion from national belonging, they are dishonored and figured as being capable only of accepting reasons but not generating their own justifications (109). Consequently, any rights obtained by extra-national citizens/subjects are contingent and revocable according to the whims of the dominant nationals, who exclusively wield the full power of justification.

Black nationalism’s utopian response is to prefiguratively “re-narrate time” so as “to incite black people to take up social practices of regard toward one another that would make rights real” (123). While Paris criticizes both the black nationalist diagnosis—he takes racial fetishism to be anchored in political economy, not the form of the nation—and remedy—he identifies a fixation on national/racial purity that renders black nationalism self-undermining—black nationalism nevertheless paradigmatically illustrates the formal model of the utopian politics of the oppressed that Paris advocates.

The fourth chapter turns to Fanon to reconstruct a theory of racial fetishization. Distinct from generic racism, which may be an intermittently occurrent cognitive and moral failing, racial fetishism is specific to capitalist modernity because capitalist societies are temporally structured by the impersonal dynamics of accumulation and exploitation. Paris’s reading of Fanon shifts focus from the cognitive failings of racism to the social “anchoring” of the norms of racial fetishism, which practically favor acting “as if” race and racial hierarchy are natural and intractable. Racial fetishism, the “objective fact that society is distorted and our conduct is fused into this form of life” renders the falsity of race effectively true (165). To the extent that we organize our lives in synchrony with dominant capitalist social practices, we practically reinforce the norms of subordination and inherent violability that give real content to the illusory form of race.

Despite Paris’s admiration for Fanon’s diagnostic acuity, he takes Fanon’s proposed solution to the problem of racial fetishism to lean too far towards existentialism away from Marxism. He claims that Fanon offers an insufficient, voluntaristic remedy to this diagnosis through the figure of the “shedding” [dépouillement] of the historical distortion of race in view of a future collective freedom. While Fanon critically engages a utopian orientation towards the future at the heart of his politics of liberation, which Paris affirms, he fails to root this utopianism in a concrete theory of the objective conditions of social transformation—therefore missing the necessary link between crisis consciousness, utopian consciousness, and the objective conditions for the actualization of a new form of social life.

The final chapter endorses James Boggs’s treatment of racial fetishism’s structural anchoring in capitalist development’s uneven social temporalities as a remedy to Fanon’s blind spots. Boggs concretely links the reproduction of racial domination to the capitalist tendency to automate labor processes, and consequently, to expel laborers and render them “outsiders”, surplus to the requirements of capital valorization. Contrary to the black nationalist diagnosis, which takes racial domination to be anchored in the exclusion of the racialized from representation in the nation, Boggs takes capitalist states’ unequal provision and enforcement of rights to be a consequence of the state’s functional dependence on capital accumulation. Boggs’s vision of Black Power consequently exceeds civil rights by calling for the development of a revolutionary counterpublic capable of envisioning and accomplishing a fundamental transformation of the nature of the state and political economy and thus of the meaning of rights, not only their extension.

If Boggs represents the nadir of the utopian tradition of black liberation politics for Paris, this is because he diagnoses racial fetishism, affirms the asynchronous source of utopian consciousness, and connects the utopian visions of the “outsiders” to the structural overcoming of the capitalist conditions that generate racial fetishism. To inherit Boggs’s suppressed dream today is to articulate racial justice as the fundamental reordering of social temporality.

While I found Paris’s treatments of utopia, racial fetishism, and the temporal dimensions of racial domination convincing, I nevertheless have a concern about the success of the book’s overall claim to synthetically link race, time, and utopia in a consistent, critical framework, which stems from the book’s ambiguous treatment of race as a category in relation to racial domination. Paris’s ambition to analyze racial fetishism as temporal domination fits uneasily with standing constructivist analyses of race. This is a strength insofar as Paris is able to offer a very specific and compelling account of the mechanisms of racial domination and their reproduction, but a weakness insofar as his account loses the extensional specificity that speaks in favor of the more body-centric constructivist analyses found in thinkers like Mills, Taylor, or Hardimon.^[1] 

The extensional vagueness of race categories is problematic for Paris’s project because he is committed to arguing that utopianism is a persistent strain in black liberation politics (rather than generally in the politics of the oppressed across history), specifically because racial fetishism is a temporal form of social domination. To secure this claim, however, more work is needed to close the gaps between the divergent accounts of temporal displacement and asynchrony identified by Paris’s interlocutors and the specificity of the form of race as such. This is no small task, as Marxians and others committed to offering historically specific accounts of the specificity of race as a form of hierarchical social difference continue to debate what renders race distinct from class, nationality, gender, and other adjacent categories. Nevertheless, supporting the strongest, and most interesting, versions of Paris’ central theses does require such an account.

Despite this concern, Race, Time, and Utopia is an impressive contribution that opens a very promising path for future research in critical theory and philosophy of race, which I sincerely hope will be pursued by Paris and other like-minded scholars.

REFERENCES

Hardimon, Michael O. “The Ordinary Concept of Race.” Journal of Philosophy, vol. 100, n. 9 (2003): 437-455.

Mills, Charles, “But What are you Really?” in Blackness Visible (Cornell, 1998): 41-66.

Taylor, Paul C., Race: A Philosophical Introduction (Polity, 2022).