No philosopher has done more than Michael Devitt to develop an account of language that accommodates (i) the broadly Fregean insight that the meanings of proper names and of certain other terms seem not to be their referents, (ii) the broadly Kripkean insight that the meanings of proper names and of certain other terms seem not to be descriptions, and (iii) the broadly Quinean commitment to a naturalistic metaphysics and epistemology. For this reason, Devitt has been one of the most distinguished philosophers of language of the last fifty years. The publication of Reference and Beyond: Essays in Philosophy of Language should be welcome news to scholars in the field, regardless of whether they agree with Devitt’s occasionally provocative views.
The volume, which can be regarded as a companion to Putting Metaphysics First: Essays on Metaphysics and Epistemology (2010), consists of thirteen essays published between 1974 and 2015. These essays are presented in chronological order of publication, but the volume includes a lengthy introduction (Chapter 1) that provides an outline of the topics covered. These topics include general methodology (Chapters 10, 12, and 14), proper names (Chapters 2, 5, 7, 10 and 13), definite descriptions (Chapters 2, 3 and 8), demonstratives (Chapter 2), kind terms (Chapters 7, 9 and 14), thought ascriptions (Chapters 4 and 11), and Putnam’s model-theoretic problem for the determinacy of reference (Chapter 6). The introduction also provides summaries of each essay.
In addition to a helpful introduction, Devitt has added new footnotes to his essays and substantial postscripts to seven of them: “Singular Terms” (Chapter 2), “A Shocking Idea About Meaning” (Chapter 7), “The Case for Referential Descriptions” (Chapter 8), “Rigid Application” (Chapter 9), “What Makes a Property Semantic?” (Chapter 12), “Should Proper Names Still Seem So Problematic?” (Chapter 13), and “Testing Theories of Reference” (Chapter 14). This volume is therefore valuable even to those who are already familiar with Devitt’s work. It represents his most current thinking on the topics covered, which are still hotly debated.
One such topic is proper names, which, for better or worse, has dominated discussion in contemporary philosophy of language. Unsurprisingly, it arises more often than any other topic in the volume. Some of Devitt’s views on proper names are orthodox, at least since the pioneering work of Kripke, Putnam, and others. Standardly, proper names do not refer through some description, but through a causal chain linking the user of the name with an initial dubbing of the referent. Despite being orthodox, this account is more of a “picture” than a theory, as Kripke once put it, and details need to be provided. Devitt has made a commendable effort to provide those details, addressing the phenomena of reference grounding, borrowing, change, and confusion. The result is a plausible account of reference that is unquestionably closer to a theory. But Devitt does not deny that there is more work to be done. On his view, “any theory of reference at this time must look to future psycholinguistics for more details” (371).
Much more controversial is Devitt’s account of meaning. Since descriptivism has fallen out of favor, the Millian theory, whereby the meaning of a proper name is simply its referent, has enjoyed renewed popularity. Intuitions to the contrary are allegedly explained by non-semantic phenomena, whether psychological or pragmatic. But, as Devitt correctly observes, the failure of descriptivism does not entail that Millianism is true. Devitt holds that the meaning of a name is the causal mode of reference that connects the referent and the user of the name. Even though Frege was wrong to treat modes of reference as descriptive in nature, he was right to identify the meaning of a name with its mode of reference. A little more carefully, Devitt would prefer to say that the meaning of a name is its property of referring to an individual under a certain causal mode, which encompasses the property of simply referring to that individual. Millians, or “direct reference theorists” as Devitt calls them, focus on this latter property, which is admittedly an important semantic property of the name. But the former property of referring under a certain causal mode is more appropriately considered the name’s meaning (374-377).
As suggested by the title of Chapter 7, some have found this idea to be somewhat shocking. Salmón, a prominent defender of Millianism, describes Devitt’s account as “ill conceived if not downright desperate…a confusion, on the order of a category mistake” (1986, 70-71). Devitt complains at one point that Salmón “says almost nothing in support of this” (137), comparing Salmón’s remarks to an incredulous stare. It is worth noting, though, that Salmón suggests, in the same paragraph that Devitt quotes, that Devitt’s account leads to an undesirable “subjectivity” in meaning, “since different users of the name enter into different chains of communication” (1986, 70). Trenchant or not, this is at least an argument rather than an incredulous stare. (In fact, Devitt replies to the argument in a much later essay, though only in a brief footnote: 278, n. 29.)
Regardless, Devitt is surely right when he says that his account is felt to be shocking mainly because of deep philosophical disagreements concerning the correct approach to semantics. Salmón and others endorse a propositional approach whereby the meaning of a name is a constituent of propositions entertained by speakers who use the name. Indeed, Salmón’s main objection to Devitt’s account is that it is “wildly bizarre” to think that causal chains serve as such constituents (1986, 71). Devitt rejects propositions, finding them offensive to his naturalism. As he writes, “it is hard to see how such objects, ‘outside space and time’, could be relevant to explaining the causal role that language plays in the natural world” (2). Relatedly, Devitt rejects any “Cartesian” tradition in semantics whereby speakers have privileged cognitive access to the semantic properties of the languages that they speak. His account of meaning, as he seems to fully understand, is plausible only when taken together with these broader theoretical commitments.
In arguing for his account, Devitt remains steadfast in his anti-Cartesianism. He agrees with Frege that co-referential names like ‘Superman’ and ‘Clark Kent’ differ in meaning, but not because they differ in “cognitive value”. From Devitt’s methodological perspective, what is important is the role that these names play in the explanation of behavior. The central argument that he gives in support of his account is: (1) a name in a subordinate clause of an apparently opaque attitude ascription, like ‘Lois Lane believes that Superman flies’ or ‘Lois Lane believes that Clark Kent is a reporter’, conveys information about a mode of reference; (2) a name’s mode of reference is causal; (3) apparently opaque attitude ascriptions explain behavior in virtue of what they convey; (4) so, the causal mode of reference is the name’s meaning (2025, 280).
The most contestable premise is the first. Devitt suggests that Salmón seems to accept it (Salmón 1986, 116), but this suggestion is perhaps misleading. Salmón allows that ordinary attitude ascriptions are often used to convey information about specific ways in which agents think of individuals. These are what Salmón calls “guises”. But Salmón does not commit himself to the view that guises are the causal chains that determine the referent of a name. Moreover, as a devout Millian, he thinks that any such information is merely pragmatically conveyed. Devitt addresses the general view that any information beyond the referent is merely pragmatically conveyed, but regards this view as unsatisfactory because, according to him, names are regularly and conventionally used to convey modes of reference (283).
But the practice of using names in attitude ascriptions is arguably messier than Devitt acknowledges. For example, as Berg observed long ago, it is easy to imagine scenarios where it seems entirely true to say ‘Lois Lane believes that Superman is a reporter’ (1988), where the only thing of relevance is the referent of the name and not any mode of reference associated with the name. Of course, it is open to Devitt to say that such attitude ascriptions are transparent rather than genuinely opaque, but this is exactly what Millians say about attitude ascriptions in general, or at least attitude ascriptions involving names in their subordinate clauses.
This does not mean that Millians deny that attitude ascriptions play a role in explaining behavior. Braun, in particular, has made an impressive effort to show how an attitude ascription, understood along Millian lines, can provide such an explanation (2001). Devitt insists, however, that “ascribing modes of reference provides a more complete explanation” (282). Braun has replied that, though modes of reference would provide more explanatory information concerning an agent’s behavior, this does not show that modes of reference enter into the semantics of ordinary attitude ascriptions (2020, 227-234). Consider an analogy. One can explain why Ortcutt fell by saying ‘Ortcutt slipped on a banana peel’. Technical details, “such as the coefficient of friction of the sidewalk beneath the banana peel” (Braun 2020, 233), would provide more explanatory information, but these details do not enter into the semantics of ‘Ortcutt slipped on a banana peel’.
There is not enough space here to litigate the debate between Braun and Devitt. Interested readers should certainly look at Devitt’s response (2020, 408-414), though this response does not seem to address Braun’s analogy. At this stage in the dispute over Millianism, it is perhaps safest to say, as Braun does, that “the evidential situation is complex” (2020, 234), despite Devitt’s judgment that the case against Millianism is “overwhelming” (284, n. 37).
Though this review has focused on the semantics of proper names, it should be mentioned again that other topics are covered in Devitt’s volume. It is rich in content. Having these essays collected together is very much appreciated. Written in Devitt’s admirably straightforward style, I enjoyed rereading them and reconsidering the many difficult philosophical issues that they raise, even when I found myself disagreeing with some of Devitt’s conclusions. Agree with him or not, Devitt has spent decades thinking deeply and seriously about the nature of language. His work continues to be deserving of engagement and discussion. All this to say that I recommend this volume. For those interested in philosophy of language from a specifically naturalistic perspective, it is no exaggeration to say that this volume is required reading.
REFERENCES
Berg, Jonathan (1988). The Pragmatics of Substitutivity. Linguistics and Philosophy 11: 355-370.
Braun, David (2001). Russellianism and Explanation. Philosophical Perspectives 15: 253-289.
Braun, David (2020). Still for Direct Reference. Language and Reality from a Naturalistic Perspective: Themes fromMichael Devitt, edited by Andrea Bianchi: 193-235. Springer.
Devitt, Michael (2010). Putting Metaphysics First: Essays on Metaphysics and Epistemology. Oxford University Press.
Devitt, Michael (2020). Stirring the Possum: Responses to the Bianchi Papers. Language and Reality from a Naturalistic Perspective: Themes from Michael Devitt, edited by Andrea Bianchi: 371-455. Springer.
Devitt, Michael (2025). Reference and Beyond: Essays in Philosophy of Language. Oxford University Press.
Salmón, Nathan (1986). Frege’s Puzzle. The MIT Press.