Respecting Disability: Attitudes, Ideals, and Relationships

Adam Cureton’s Respecting Disability: Attitudes, Ideals, and Relationships is the inaugural title in OUP’s new book series, Oxford Studies in Disability, Ethics, and Society, and it sets the bar high for all future books in the series. According to the blurb on OUP’s website, the series “illuminates disabilityʼs relevance in human life, in all its forms and meanings,” which Cureton’s new book does by exploring respect in all its myriad forms and what respecting disability ought to look like across a range of real-life scenarios.

Respecting Disability moves the philosophical discussion in disability ethics forward in at least three ways: First, whereas existing work tends to focus on formal rights, Cureton’s book explores attitudes, relationships, and actions that may not violate strict requirements of justice but which nonetheless fall short of the moral ideal. Second, whereas existing work tends to focus on the duties non-disabled people have towards disabled people, Cureton’s book also addresses the moral dilemmas disabled people face, and how they can fail to respect themselves. Third, although the importance of taking what disabled people say into account is by now generally recognized, the “disabled perspective” tends to be overrepresented by insights from the Disability Rights Movement, with disability-negative attitudes acknowledged but not focused on.^[1] Cureton not only acknowledges the existence of more complicated attitudes disabled people may have about their disabilities, but also makes such attitudes the centerpiece of his analysis in multiple chapters.

The book is divided into 3 parts, each comprising four chapters. In what follows, I will give an overview of the issues presented in each chapter, before offering some general remarks about the book as a whole.

Part 1 (Self-Respect of People with Disabilities) focuses on the unique moral quandaries disabled people face. In Chapter 1, Cureton explores why a disabled person might try to pass themself off as non-disabled, explaining that the benefits of things like greater social acceptance, less awkward relationships, and enhanced self-esteem may seem worth going without the accommodations to which they are entitled. Nevertheless, Cureton cautions, hiding one’s disability also has less obvious costs, such as damage to one’s self-respect if the deception causes one to no longer accept oneself as a disabled person.

Chapter 2 explores whether disabled people ought to use accommodations that they are (justly) entitled to, but which they do not actually need in a particular situation. Cureton’s position is that although doing so would not be wrong, forgoing such accommodations can better realize an ideal of self-respect.

Chapter 3 traces how even after the right to accommodations has been formally secured the undependability of the systems providing those accommodations still undermines disabled people’s confidence and restricts what they choose to do. Accommodation systems need to be evaluated not just for whether they are providing the required accommodations, but also with respect to how robust and stable they are.

Lastly, Chapter 4 discusses identity crises as the result of becoming disabled, arguing that self-respect requires one to act in ways justifiable to not just one’s present, but also one’s past and future selves.

In Part 2 (Respect for People with Disabilities), Cureton then turns to the reasons behind common attitudes non-disabled people have towards disabled people, why these attitudes fall short of the moral ideal, and practical advice for doing better. Chapter 5 is built around a fictionalized case study of a disabled student and various encounters she has at a party where some of her fellow students want to help her, others are curious about her, and still others avoid talking to her because she makes them uncomfortable. Via an analysis of respect that has as its object another’s identity (as opposed to their human dignity, admirable achievements, or distinguished status), Cureton offers a meticulous diagnosis of why these interactions fall short of the ideal. This was one of my favorite discussions in the book: the concept of identity as an object of respect seems to me both plausible and explanatorily powerful. Beyond its application to disability ethics, for instance, it also lends itself naturally to understanding why people of marginalized identities may not be wholly reassured when they are told that they are respected qua human being—respect for human dignity is indeed valuable, but that alone is not what they are asking for.

Chapter 6 delves deeper into why otherwise good people might nonetheless come to have less than respectful attitudes about disability. These include when the salience of disability as a trait blinds us to seeing the person behind the disability; when our genuine concern for a disabled person’s wellbeing is distorted by stereotypical assumptions about their good; and when we overemphasize the wellbeing of people with disabilities at the expense of other moral values like respect. All of these, Cureton argues, fail to accord proper respect, acceptance, and appreciation to disabled people.

Chapter 7 then explores why these well-intentioned attitudes are wrong, this time through the idea of respect as a negative attitude. By “negative attitude”, what Cureton means is that sometimes what respect requires is for one to refrain from care, help, or advice because these seemingly benevolent actions would in fact encroach on another’s personal boundaries. This involves not making assumptions about them, respecting their privacy, and not intruding on their responsibilities and prerogatives. Accordingly, actions such as commending a disabled person for their fortitude are problematic because they involve making assumptions about them; asking strangers to share details about how they cope with their disability disrespects their privacy; and even getting angry on behalf of a disabled person might infringe on their right to advocate for themself.

Lastly, Chapter 8 rounds off Part 2 with a discussion of why well-intentioned acts of beneficence can be offensive, even when they in fact do benefit the beneficiary. Among these is one of the most interesting (if controversial) arguments in the book: Drawing on Kant, Cureton suggests that since recipients of optional beneficence incur debts of gratitude to their benefactor, the beneficiary then stands in an inferior position compared to the benefactor. This in turn hurts the beneficiary’s self-respect, but the proper target of their resulting resentment is not the benefactor (who is still properly due gratitude) but rather the beneficiary’s own self, who is to blame for needing and accepting the favor in the first place. This explains why someone might dislike being on the receiving end of beneficence, and why (for Kant) “it is disrespectful for others to intend to bind us by the assistance they aim to give us” (175). Moreover, since disabled people are on balance more likely to be recipients of help and less likely to have chances to render similar assistance to others, they may be especially sensitive about the moral inequality these acts of beneficence create, thus explaining why a disabled person might be prickly or frustrated at receiving well-meant help. I found this analysis interesting. However, I hope I am not too optimistic in thinking that most people who try to help the disabled are not intending to “bind” or “subordinate” their beneficiaries by that assistance, and if so, surely that act is not in fact disrespectful and should not be offensive.

The final section, Part 3, applies the ideals of respect and self-respect developed in Parts 1 and 2 to particular contexts, namely the medical setting (Chapter 9), the stigma surrounding disabled people as prospective parents (Chapter 10), the way in which schools are failing in the character development of disabled students (Chapter 11), and the morally objectionable but unfortunately commonplace practice of treating disabled adults as children (Chapter 12).

Notably, all 12 chapters are reprints of previous papers by Cureton that have appeared elsewhere. Nevertheless, the book remains remarkably cohesive, with respect as a central theme running through the book. Readers who are less interested in the minutiae of different flavors of respect may find some parts repetitive, but the fact that this allows each chapter to be read as a standalone piece is to my mind an advantage.

One of the book’s greatest strengths is the breadth of disabled experiences (both his own, and those of others) that Cureton draws on in each chapter. As I mentioned at the start of this review, the inclusion of complex, less unambiguously positive attitudes about disability is relatively rare in philosophical work in disability ethics, and Cureton handles these perspectives with a laudable sympathy that nonetheless does not shy away from pointing out where he thinks such attitudes fall short of the moral ideal. Additionally, the bottom-up approach of grounding his analysis in the experience of disabled people also ensures that all the issues Cureton discusses are realistic and highly practical.

Next, as readers familiar with Cureton’s other work will not be surprised to learn, Cureton draws frequently on Kantian and Kantian-inspired ideas throughout the book. For the most part, this should not alienate people who do not count themselves as Kantians: most people will agree, for instance, that disabled people are worthy of respect even if they don’t think it is their rational nature that grounds that worthiness. And most people will also agree that autonomy is valuable, even if they don’t take it to be the central pillar of our moral life. This should be enough to get on board with much of Cureton’s account, and even if one does have reservations about some of the theoretical nitty gritty, the advice about how to better respect disabled people in practice remains solid.

One significant drawback of the Kantian scaffolding, however, is that it is not naturally suited for the inclusion of the cognitively disabled. Cureton is well-aware of this, and is explicit that on his account, rational nature is to be understood in terms of mere potentiality so as to include infants, those with Down Syndrome, and those in comas (12, 124). Moreover, since he thinks it is conceptually possible for something like extreme brain damage to destroy even the bare potential for reason (he gives the example of people in persistently vegetative states), he also adds that “even if we were to encounter human beings who we know lack a rational nature, they still merit our respect and concern on other grounds that do not depend on having the kind of dignity we are discussing” (13). So it would be unfair to accuse Cureton of denying that the cognitively disabled are due respect. Nevertheless, the fact that the Kantian inspiration of much of his theoretical machinery is ill-suited to the cognitively disabled does mean that a discussion of what respecting the cognitively disabled looks like is, for the most part, absent from the book. This strikes me as a missed opportunity, especially because a key insight of the book, namely that non-disabled people all too often allow concerns of beneficence to override concerns of respect when interacting with disabled people, is especially applicable to the cognitively disabled.

That aside, Respecting Disability is a nuanced and insightful account into moral issues surrounding disability that have been relatively under-discussed in disability ethics, but which people are likely to have encountered in real life, making it valuable reading for everyone, and not just scholars of disability. Cureton himself says he intends the book for the educated general reader, and I think on balance this is true, although I would add that the reader may also require some perseverance. Although by no means overly technical, those who are not used to dense and careful philosophical writing may find some parts difficult to get through (Chapter 4’s discussion of prudential rationality and temporal preference/neutrality when it comes to respecting past, present and future selves, for instance, comes to mind). Nor does Cureton include signposts for what readers who are interested in the practical advice but not the theoretical machinery can skip, and where they should pick up reading again. Nevertheless, there is so much of value in this book that the reader who does make the effort will find their effort well worth it.