This substantial volume consists of sixteen original essays that cover a broad scope within analytic moral philosophy together with a lengthy introduction by Sarah Buss that attempts to unify the essays. Buss correctly says that the subject is important beyond philosophy. Making sense of the value of humanity may help us understand our common concerns about a world in which people and groups often treat each other in ways that shock one’s conscience. The idea of our humanity, and how it is connected to the nature and implications of basic human rights should be of universal interest and concern.
The essays in this book, I believe, are not easily accessible to readers without some philosophical background and some awareness of the history of Western moral and political thought. Many of the chapters address the views of particular philosophers and, although they are uniformly of very high quality, they may be hard to understand by people otherwise unfamiliar with the work of the philosophers they discuss. On the whole, however, each chapter is a rich resource for those who are interested in moral philosophy and its development. Any of them could, on its own, be a topic for discussion in a graduate seminar in philosophy or political theory.
The idea of the value of humanity leaves so much to be unpacked that even such a large and ambitious book as this one cannot give it an exhaustive treatment. If we take “humanity” to refer to our species, which we sometimes characterize as rational animals of a certain kind, then a particular set of questions becomes salient. We are a product of evolution, of course, but we also know that species go extinct. Does it matter that humanity should continue to exist? What, more specifically and in response to real threats to our continued existence, are our obligations to future generations? Suppose we say that the value of humanity has nothing to do with the natural history that produced our species but rests instead in what we have accomplished, such as knowledge, art, culture, and the many artifacts we prize. If we knew that humanity would soon disappear at the hands (or some other appendage) of invading aliens, we might be somewhat consoled were we assured that the aliens would guarantee the survival of the best human accomplishments, but we might also feel saddened to think that the human connection to the things that make humanity valuable would be lost. What are the implications of such thoughts for the value of humanity?
Alternatively, if we take the value of humanity to refer to the moral value of human beings taken individually, then we encounter a different set of questions and challenges. The idea that human beings as such have moral value has been criticized as “speciesist” by philosophers who see no moral value attaching to individuals simply in virtue of their genetic makeup. If instead we focus on the common properties of human beings that we do consider to be morally important, then we must confront the facts that some humans lack those properties and some nonhumans possess them. And if we say instead that human beings have value because of the valuable properties and traits that are normal in the species, so that we can attribute that value to newborns, fetuses, and the severely demented, then we need to explain why moral value extends, like a royal title, from individuals who have “earned it” to other family members or heirs. The essays in this book address some but not all of these questions.
It is commonplace in ethics to point out that the ancient philosophers were primarily interested in addressing the question, “How should I live my life?” while post-Enlightenment philosophers were more concerned with the question, “What do we owe other people (or, more recently, other sentient creatures)?” Richard Bett’s essay on ancient Greek ethics is the only essay in this book that discusses pre-Enlightenment philosophy. I shall, therefore, discuss his essay at greater length than the others.
Ancient Greek ethics, Bett argues, focuses on the agent and not on creatures who are affected by the agent’s actions. He claims that when Plato argues “that it is worse to do injustice than to suffer it, the central point is always the bad effect of committing injustice on the agent. . .rather than the bad effect on those unjustly treated.” Given this perspective in Greek ethics, the value of humanity does not directly enter their thought.
We see another vivid example in Aristotle’s admiration of the magnanimous or great-souled person, who appears to many contemporary readers, as he does to Bett, to be “a pompous, self-important jerk.” The defining mark of the magnanimous person is that he receives disproportionately great honors as his due. (Always a “he”!) Ancient ethics, whatever its other virtues, was not egalitarian. Slavery was tolerated, thought to be socially necessary, and in one of Aristotle’s most unfortunate passages, even defended. Nevertheless, Bett concludes that, “in Aristotle we have at least a glimmer of the idea that human beings as such are valuable. But it is not developed, and it is not easily assimilable to the much more hierarchical picture we find in most of his thinking, where some people have more value and others less.”
What makes humans valuable and distinguishes them from other creatures is their rational nature or, as Plato puts it, their “kinship” with the gods. Philosophizing, in Aristotle’s view, is the highest activity in part because (in Bett’s words) “it expresses something divine in us.” But it is also clear that this is an activity not available to everyone. These themes, which express the importance of humanity and distinguishes us from other creatures, are further refined in later Greek ethics, especially the Stoics. Still, Bett argues, “these ideas keep coming up against a variety of other ideas that push powerfully in a much more hierarchical—some might say elitist —direction, where value is shared very unequally, some humans having a great deal of value and others much less so.”
The remaining chapters in this volume cluster, more or less, into three groups: the first group discusses the views of philosophers of the early Enlightenment or modern period, roughly the seventeenth century; the second group focuses on Kant, who is surely the most important figure in generating the subject of the value of humanity as it is understood today; and the final group of essays explores contemporary views (but also includes an essay on Hume), which elaborate and criticize Kantian themes and the legacy of modernism.
A central feature of the scientific revolution of the sixteenth and seventeenth centuries was the rejection of Aristotle’s teleological view of nature. The modernist view regards humans as part of the natural order, which is governed by laws of the kind developed by the likes of Galileo, Descartes, and Newton. This leaves value, including the value of humanity, to be explained.
Chapters by Yitzhak Melamed, Julia Jorati, and Stephen Darwall discuss the views, respectively, of Descartes and Spinoza; Hobbes, Locke, and Leibniz; and Grotius and Pufendorf.
Melamed points out that Descartes, who had a large responsibility in demythologizing the natural world and encouraging us to see it not as an organism but as a machine governed by physical laws, nevertheless remained theistic in his attitude toward humanity. In an early essay, Descartes remarks that, “The Lord has made three marvels: something out of nothing; free will; and God in Man.” This is an expression of Descartes’ humanism, which Melamed characterizes as resting on three claims. It “assigns a unique value or rank to human beings among other things in nature;” it stresses the primacy of the human perspective; and it finds properties in persons that make such claims not simply instances of speciesism. In contrast, Melamed argues, Spinoza’s naturalism makes him a critic of humanism. Spinoza famously criticized the notions of an anthropocentric deity and the idea of free will, but Melamed argues that his Ethics “is a book about human beings not because humanity is elevated above the rest of nature, but for the simple reason that its author, being a human being, desperately wished to know the conditions required for his pursuit of a blessed life.”
Although Spinoza was a quintessentially modern philosopher, Melamed emphasizes that Spinoza thought friendship was a central virtue of humanity, which perhaps led him to his anti-Hobbesian view of democracy as the ideal political system. Because Spinoza identified God with nature, genuine self-esteem should, in Melamed’s words, be “grounded in our being-in-God, a characteristic we share with everything that is (sea waves and porcupines included).” He concludes by endorsing Hegel’s critique of Spinoza for “striving to undermine our common myths about the nature and value of humanity.”
Jorati focuses on the ethics of freedom and slavery in the writings of Hobbes, Locke, and Leibniz. For Hobbes, all people are free in the state of nature and have rights to everything. This includes the right to own or control other people, which implies, as Hobbes says, that people “can be bought and sold as beasts.” Locke’s more robust defenses of freedom and equality are at the least complicated by his commercial interest in the slave trade. In Two Treatises of Government Locke denounces slavery as a “vile and miserable” estate of man, but in his later Fundamental Constitutions of Carolina, he writes, “Every freeman of Carolina shall have absolute power and authority over his Negro slaves.” Jorati argues that Leibniz also had complicated views about slavery and equality, but compared to Hobbes and Locke, he has the most “attractive conception of human value and the right to freedom.”
If Hobbes, Locke, and Leibniz wrestle with the idea of making sense of the values of liberty, equality, and human rights in the context of the hierarchical political systems of their day, Grotius and Pufendorf, as Darwall argues, introduce us to the important concept of the priority of the value of moral rights over the good. The interest of each of these philosophers is more with legal and political philosophy, but Darwall takes both to be defending the “doctrine of the dignity of persons” as the basis for human social life. Pufendorf, for example, argued for Man’s natural equality or “dignity,” which he called the “public worth of man.” And Grotius defends the ideas of dignity and sovereignty of states, which Darwall sees as applying also to the value of individuals. In these philosophers, Darwall concludes, “We have at least a strong suggestion, perhaps the first, of a conception of moral community as mutual accountability.” A moral community is seen here as one of “mutually accountable equals.”
By the time of Kant the idea of human equality had been established in Western philosophy, but this tells us nothing about the value of humanity. Kant famously claims that we have a moral duty to treat all rational beings as ends-in-themselves, and not merely as means. This is because we can make claims on other rational beings, and we recognize that they can make claims on us. Human beings, Kant says, have dignity, which is beyond all price, and they merit not just concern, which we might extend to our sentient pets, but also respect. The essays in this volume that discuss Kant’s views try to explain what dignity is and why rationality or rational agency is something to be valued. These essays together constitute a genuine contribution to contemporary Kant scholarship.
I haven’t space here to discuss these arguments, but one theme that recurs in them is that it is a mistake to regard any property, including rationality, as justifying the view that beings who possess it have special moral value that we have a duty to discover and respond to. Why should rationality, rather than the ability to fly, ground moral value? Kant’s idea, which the essays discussing Kant agree on, is not that we value something because we discover that it is good or valuable; rather, things are valuable because we value them. In interpreting (but not endorsing) Kant’s view, Peter Railton reads Kant as arguing that our humanity consists in “treating one’s rational will, one’s humanity, as if it were an ‘end in itself,’ independently of any object it might take.” Railton’s Kant explains that, “Value need not be reified as a ‘thing,’ a feature of the universe in itself, which humanity helps us discover and respond to aptly. Instead, valuing is an activity belonging to us as rational choosers, possessing the ‘objectivity,’ not of self-subsisting objects, but of a requirement of pure practical reason.” Of course, we human beings are also desire-driven creatures, which leads Railton to characterize Kant’s view as one that sees rationality as what makes value possible, but sees our humanity better characterized as an intermediate position “between the ‘unholy’ animal and the ‘holy’ purely rational being thus [making] distinctively human lives a struggle within oneself and with one another.”
Don Garrett’s essay on Hume is taken out of its historical context and placed at the beginning of a set of essays that emphasize features other than rationality as the basis of whatever value humanity has. The editors chose to place Hume with this final set of essays because of a sharper contrast between Hume’s views and Kant’s, and also because “some of the distinctively un-Kantian elements of Hume’s approach can be found in the positions defended by contemporary moral philosophers.” Kieran Setiya and Kyla Ebels-Duggan discuss the importance of love in understanding the value of persons, and Setiya defends his view with a lengthy discussion of Emmanuel Levinas. Elijah Millgram discusses Nietzsche’s rejection of the idea of the value of humanity or the idea that humans have infinite value. And Akeel Bilgrami describes and defends Gandhi’s criticism of post-Enlightenment political ideals that focus on the tensions between liberty and equality. What is crucial for Gandhi is to perceive the world differently. In Bilgrami’s words, “matter is not mere matter but shot through with values, whose ultimate source is divine.” Realizing this may help us overcome the alienation we often feel from the natural world. These four essays are each original and wonderfully suggestive.
But I now return to comment on Hume and an omission in this book. Garrett explains that Hume, a “moral antirationalist and moral naturalist,” in contrast with Kant, “did not explicitly discuss ‘the value of humanity’ as such.” Our concern and love for others is based on our sentiments and passions. Hume writes, “In general, it may be affirm’d, that there is no such passion in human minds, as the love of mankind, merely as such.” Garrett nevertheless carefully reconstructs from Hume’s writings the view that individual humans have value and, “Humanity considered collectively presumably has at least the accumulated value of its individual members.” Humanity, Hume insisted, possesses positive and negative values, which are not distributed equally among individuals.
Hume is often considered a proto-utilitarian, and Garrett’s essay makes one aware that no classical utilitarian philosophers are represented in this volume. Utilitarians also do not discuss the value of humanity as such. Rather, like all sentient creatures, humans, on utilitarian accounts, are just containers of intrinsically valuable experiences of pleasure and pain. As Christine Korsgaard has recently written, “The utilitarian claim that he values all creatures ‘equally’ is only true because he does not value creatures at all” (2018, 158).
I have often wondered how philosophers might best contribute in their philosophical lives to making the world a better place, or at least a bit less horrible. One way is by discussing issues directly related to policies and practices. But just as valuable, in what we write and teach, is to help us think clearly about central philosophical concepts, like rights and equality, that are at the heart of our concerns. The value of humanity is certainly one of these concepts, and this volume, though long and often difficult, is a stimulating and useful contribution to this effort.
REFERENCE
Christine Korsgaard, Fellow Creatures: Our Obligations to Other Animals, Oxford University Press, 2018.