Doil Kim identifies Confucian humility as a form of “self-lowering”. Other forms under this capacious heading have been criticized as prescribing self-effacement or self-sacrifice. Failure to distinguish Confucian humility from such other forms has resulted in confusion and unclarity as to what humility is, and most importantly, has obscured how Confucian humility can play a constructive role in shaping personhood in the sense of a “good and ethically formed human being” (1). Kim's aim is to make the case for Confucian humility, based on a textual analysis of early Confucian and medieval Neo-Confucian texts, followed by a discussion of how findings from contemporary cultural psychology can help us to become more aware of the diverse forms of self-lowering. The result is an exemplary work in comparative and interdisciplinary philosophy that has special relevance to contemporary societies in which individuals are encouraged to vigorously promote their strengths and achievements and to place greater importance on their own interests and desires relative to those of others. I highly recommend this compact, dense, and carefully reasoned book, which has much relevance to the cultural and political pathologies of our time.
The Chinese term that Kim translates as humility in the early Confucian tradition is qian 謙. Appearing in the Yijing (theBook of Changes), it exhibits three features: 1) a caution against excessive self-regard; 2) “self-belittlement” (bei 卑); and 3) fundamentally interpersonal orientation (19). The reader might wonder whether the translation of bei implies the self-effacement and self-deprecation that Kim contrasts with Confucian humility. However, bei is meant to counter a tendency to exaggerate one's strengths and achievements, and the primary intent of its use is to show a deference to others. This last possibility brings out qian's interpersonal orientation and its intimate association with li 禮 or ritual propriety, customary practices through which one shows respectful courtesy, gong 恭, to others. Kim argues that qian is not neglecting or undervaluing the self but rather incorporates meaningful self-constraint in order to foster an appropriate relation with others over whom one might have an advantage in sociopolitical status or practical competence. The point is to focus on the other respects in which others may be superior (32-34). Aside from the Yijing, qian is rarely mentioned in the most widely known early Confucian texts. Kim argues that nevertheless the three features of qian are closely related in meaning to clusters of terms that are centrally used in these other texts. For example, the Analects (12.20) has Confucius distinguishing the person of unreliable reputation from the one of real distinction by the latter's considerateness and lowering of self in relation to others (xia ren 下人).
In medieval Neo-Confucian philosophy, Cheng Yi and Zhu Xi deepen and refine qian. On the level of individual psychology, Confucian humility is described as non-dwelling (you er buju 有而不居). One's heart/mind (the Chinese word for mind is also the word for heart) does not dwell or fixate upon one's strengths, achievements, or higher social standing, thus “allowing for a more fluid and genuine focus on the strengths of others” (41). Rather than being self-ignorant or self-deprecating, qian is instead non-attachment to one's positive attributes, a liberation from self-centeredness (si 私), which is an “inclination to perceive and interpret the world” (42) through a perspective that gravitates towards affirmation of one's own superiority. Confucian humility is “no-self” (wu wo 無我), transcending self-centered distortions to achieve impartiality (gong 公), “a state of openness and freedom from personal bias, allowing one to perceive both oneself and others without distortion” (47).
Significantly, Neo-Confucianism's further development of humility introduces a robust moral metaphysics. The truly humble person grasps the objective structures of human relationship and rightness (yi 義) as belonging to the intrinsic order of the world (49), as further characterized by impartiality, coherent patterns (li 理), and harmony (he 和). Neo-Confucian humility further takes the form of gentle adaptability (roushun 柔順), whereby one is “gently attuned and adapted to the particularities of each situation” (54). This is why Confucian humility is an art and not a simple deductive application of Confucian values to the situation. Cheng Yi conceives of gentle adaptability as enabling the harmonizing society through the fostering of inclusivity and generosity.
Zhu Xi's conception of harmony must be understood in relation to his critique of an earlier conception propounded by Yan Ying through a metaphor of making soup from various ingredients. Good flavor is found in balancing the different ingredients, not in adding excessive amounts of one ingredient. Analogously, the ruler should not seek in ministers only those who agree with him but those who provide differences in viewpoint. As in the making of a good soup, one strives for differences making for balance and complementarity. Zhu Xi's critique of this “soup” conception of harmony is that not just any set of differences can properly constitute harmony. Zhu Xi proposes that harmony comes from alignment with core Confucian values, including rightness as “fundamentally tied to appropriate attitudes and conduct within human relationships, with an emphasis on mutual responsiveness” (72).
Kim notes that from a modern viewpoint, one might reject the inherent inequalities of premodern relationships. The Yan Ying conception of harmony may seem more appealing since it “allows for negotiation and adjustment between differences, even if the criteria for distinguishing these differences remain unclear”. But Kim holds that “Confucian philosophy does not establish the criteria for rightness in such a manner” (75). On the other hand, Kim holds that one cannot simply read off what is to be done from consulting a list of Confucian values. True harmony “requires mutual humility, where both parties lower themselves relative to the other, fostering reciprocal respect within the relationship” (76). He invokes the concept of “normative emergence, offering not a fixed moral template, but a dynamic responsiveness grounded in the heart/mind's spontaneous attunement to concrete situations”. When self-centeredness is overcome, the Heavenly patterns unfold through the heart/mind, and the right path is revealed with clarity and immediacy (80). The Neo-Confucian moral metaphysics does lead, then, to very strong claims, not only about the existence of an objective order but about the capacity of the heart/mind to grasp that order as it appears in context.
A critical response to the Neo-Confucian view that I have is that self-centeredness is not the only obstacle to overcome in obtaining that grasp. There is simply the sheer difficulty of knowing in difficult situations how or if one can resolve conflicts between relevant values. Here, another kind of humility that is not discussed by Kim is also relevant: epistemic humility. Though such humility does not have a single term for it in the early Confucian literature, one can point to passages, especially in the Analects, that suggest its importance. Confucius professes uncertainty about who is morally excellent and what this excellence consists of. That is the significance of Analects 2.17: “To know when you know something, and to know when you don't know, that's knowledge” (trans. Eno, 2015).
The debate over the minister Guan Zhong's moral status in the Analects is instructive. Confucius criticizes Guan Zhong for misuse or lack of knowledge of ritual (3.22). But Confucius also praises him for the way he punished a clan such that the head could not utter a word of resentment (14.9). In another place, when Guan Zhong is severely criticized for failing to die alongside his Prince when his brother Duke Huan seizes power and instead chooses to become the Duke's minister, Confucius surprisingly defends him, saying that it was his counsel that enabled the Duke to lead an alliance of states to successfully resist barbarian invasion (14.16-14.17). The lesson that might be drawn from this cluster of passages is that moral excellence can have different facets (related to different values), such that a person can be severely deficient with respect to one facet and excel in another. (Interestingly, the way Guan Zhong misuses ritual seems to imply his excessive self-regard.) The complexity of moral excellence is a reason for epistemic humility.
To take another example, the Shun stories in the Mengzi illustrate conflicts between filial piety and brotherly love, on the one hand, and the enforcement of justice, on the other hand, and readers may not necessarily find Mengzi's resolution of those conflicts persuasive. Even if there is an objective structure of coherent patterns that always determine a right answer, can we be confident that we will always be access to such a structure? It is difficult to see how an ethic could remain Confucian without giving significant weight to age, social status (including family relationships), and ability, and the task is to balance against this weight a sense of “fundamental equality as a core social value” (134) that Kim also sees as foundational to Confucian humility.
An alternative to the robust moral metaphysics of the Neo-Confucians can be found in the Xunzi, which strongly suggests a functionalist origin of morality instead of its origin in Heavenly patterns. Because human beings have naturally strong self-regarding and competitive motivations, they do not naturally tend to the cooperate with each other. But they need such cooperation to save themselves from destructive conflict with each other. That is why the sage-kings of old established standards of rightness and ritual to reshape human nature and to avoid conflict and optimize cooperation. This origin story is an alternative to the story the Neo-Confucians tell and may appeal more strongly to some of us contemporaries. Note that Xunzi seems to regard the standards of rightness and practices of ritual as not only objectively, but uniquely, correct because they optimize cooperation. Some of us contemporaries, again, may choose not to go that far and allow for plural ways to promote cooperation in various possible forms without deeming any single way more correct than all others. The range of humility might be expanded to encompass such questions, especially given our modern awareness of cultural pluralism and hybridity.
This point is related to Kim's interdisciplinary exploration of the way the traditional concept of Confucian humility tends to be distorted through contemporary categories that result from cultural differences, historical change, and hybridization. A “modesty bias” encompassing both self-criticism and self-deprecation is often attributed to East Asian societies. While this attribution is not entirely without a basis, Kim believes that it primarily rests on “an overdrawn and problematic binary between East and West” (83), between collectivist cultures which emphasize group harmony (not Confucian harmony but subordinating individual needs to group needs) and individualist cultures that prioritize high self-esteem. Kim rightly brings up recent scholarship that questions this binary, pointing out that such cultural values differ even within the same nation, and that the degree and form of collectivism and individualism vary across East Asian nations. Even more interestingly, the most recent scholarship proposes that cultural aspects can coexist within a single individual, with either collectivist or individualist tendencies coming to the surface depending on the situation (90). More rigorous study may succeed in distinguishing elements in cultural intermingling that are closer to Confucian humility. Kim himself has collaborated with psychologists to study what contemporary Koreans think about gyeomson, which is usually translated as humility or modesty. The studies point to a relational focus involving respect for others and on what they might do better than oneself.
Other “self-lowering concepts” discussed by Kim include Western modesty and religious humility. Western modesty is a form of self-regulation aimed at avoiding excessive self-evaluation. Religious humility involves a lowering one's evaluation of self with a dedication to God or to the divine. In comparison, Confucian humility is specifically aimed at “refraining from presenting oneself primarily through selectively emphasized strengths” motivated by the human desire for superiority, and it is underlain by a commitment to “a broader ethical and political order” (133). I highly recommend the book not only for its incisive philosophical interpretations but also for its rich and subtle interdisciplinary and comparative work.
REFERENCES
Eno, Robert (2015 version 2.2). The Analects of Confucius: A Teaching Translation. http://www.indiana.edu/~p374/