The Cartesian Brain: Philosophical and Scientific Perspectives

Cartesian studies has come a long way in recent years. It used to be (and I suspect still is the case in some places) that, when teaching Descartes, the focus was on the Meditations and on the development of his metaphysical and epistemological thought: Cartesian doubt, followed by the cogito, the proof of the existence of God, the validation of reason, the Cartesian circle and the distinction between mind and body. Students were taught that there is a body, united to the incorporeal mind, but the focus was on the mind and its connection with the body, not the details of the body itself. In recent years, more and more attention has been given to Descartes’s scientific writings as well, and within those, more and more attention has been given to his medical writings, to his conception of the human body and how it works. In The Cartesian Brain, the focus is on Descartes’s conception of the brain, and how it functions in the context of the human body, and, more generally, in the context of the human being, a union of a mind and a body with a brain.

The book is composed of twelve chapters, including an introductory chapter. After the introduction, the book is divided into two parts: “Descartes and his System” and “Cartesianism and its Legacy”. Part 1 is concerned directly with Descartes himself and his conception of the brain and the role that it plays in human life. Part 2 is concerned with the human being and its brain in later thinkers, up to and including discussions that relate Descartes’s views on the brain and how it works to views in current neuroscience.

In his forward to the volume, Denis Kambouchner writes that

the revival of brain physiology in Cartesian research (Descartes embodied) seeks to clarify the question of the union of mind and body, in order to redefine what truly belongs to the body and what to the mind. More precisely, the aim is to rethink Cartesian psychology on the basis of the physiological foundations of mental functions. (xi)

In their introduction to the volume, which constitutes Chapter 1, Damien Lacroux, Tad Schmaltz, and Ruidan She begin by noting that

Studies of Descartes’s views on cognition have tended to focus on the Cartesian mind to the virtual exclusion of the Cartesian brain. Without denying the importance of the former, however, it must be noted that Descartes himself had a keen interest in the latter not only as the primary site of mind-body interaction but also as a main point of contact between explanations of human and other animal behavior. (1)

They also advance the view that “a deeper exploration of Descartes’s theory of the brain can provide the basis for a better understanding of the domain of the mind” (2). In short, one might say that the point of the book is to reintroduce the brain into studies of the Cartesian person.

After the foreword and the introduction, the eleven remaining chapters are of roughly three kinds. Some are largely exegetical, setting out the details of some aspect of Descartes’s account of the brain and its functioning; some involve philosophical problems and complexities in Descartes’s accounts and the accounts of some later followers; and finally, some involve the relations between Cartesian accounts of the brain, its functioning in the human being and contemporary neuroscience.

Franco Meschini’s essay, “The Doctrine of the Pineal Gland: A Cryptic Doctrine” (Chapter 2) deals with Descartes’s well-known obsession with the pineal gland, the site at which the incorporeal mind is attached to the corporeal body. Meschini offers an encyclopedic survey of Descartes’s texts, documenting all of the references to the gland (which Descartes generally doesn’t refer to as the pineal gland), as they are found (or in some cases, not found) in texts early and late, both published and, like the correspondence, not, from the early Traité de l’homme through to the Passions de l’âme.

This is followed by Denis Kambouchner’s essay, “‘Power of the Soul’ and Imagination: A Psychophysiological Hypothesis” (Chapter 3). The pineal gland is at issue here as well, but Kambouchner’s concern is with the ability the soul has to move the gland. Drawing mainly on the Traité de l’homme and on the Passions de l’âme, Kambouchner examines in great detail what Descartes has to say about how Descartes’s mind operates on the brain both in producing motions in the pineal gland, and “physical ideas”, physical traces of thought in the brain. He is particularly interested in the way the interaction is shaped by what he calls the “disposition of the brain”, its physical state and the physical contribution of the motion of the animal spirits to the motion of the pineal gland.

Speaking within the Cartesian framework, a mechanical body of enormous complexity attached to an incorporeal soul, it is quite striking that the volition that the mind exercises over the pineal gland generally manages to exert considerable control over the body: when I decide to raise my arm, it almost always raises, and when I decide to express myself in speech, words expressing my thoughts can be heard by others. One thing that surprised me about the article was that there was no mention at all of the question of the union of mind and body and the simple notion of union. The union plays no role in Descartes’s account of the human being in L’Homme, but it is quite important by the time of the Passions de l’âme.

The fact that the mind can act on the body through acting on the pineal gland raises an obvious problem for Descartes. Central to his physics, from early to late, is the conservation of quantity of motion, the sum of size times speed of all of the bodies in the world. But if the mind can act on the body, even if it is just the pineal gland, then it would seem that this general law would be violated. This is the issue that Frédéric de Buzon takes up in his essay, “Attribution and Determination: Some Remarks on Voluntary Motion” (Chapter 4). Now, the quantity that Descartes thinks is conserved is size times speed, not the vector quantity velocity. So, if the direction of the motion of a given body is changed without changing its speed, as happens, say, when a ball is reflected off of a wall, then the quantity of motion remains the same.

De Buzon analyzes very carefully how Descartes talks about the way the mind acts on the pineal gland. He concludes that all that is changed is the direction of the motion of the animal spirits and not their speed. So, he concludes, the mind can act on the pineal gland, and through that, act on the animal spirits that determine the gross motions of the body (raising one’s arm, for example) without violating the conservation of the quantity of motion. This has been a somewhat controversial issue in Cartesian scholarship, and some (such as the author of this review) have argued that though the conservation law is a constraint on an immutable God, the mind can add motion to the world (2001, 133-167). However, based on the details of the various ways Descartes talks about the kinds of changes in the pineal gland that the mind can cause, de Buzon has presented a serious argument that the action of the mind on the body does not result in any violations of Descartes’ conservation law.

Gary Hatfield’s essay, “Descartes’s Corporeal Idea of Distance: Information Processing or Mechanical Correlation?” (Chapter 5) considers the role of the mind and the body (brain) in the perception of distance. Descartes suggests that we perceive distance by virtue of a kind of “natural geometry”. The essay is largely directed against a view that Stephen Gaukroger advanced, namely, that this “natural geometry” involves a “sensory awareness and mental calculation” that he attributes both to humans and to animals (67, 76-81).

Against this, Hatfield argues that for Descartes, “in humans, the natural geometry is realized by a brain state that covaries with physical distance and thereby causes the mental perception of distance, through an institution of nature” (85-86). The “mental representation” in question is a state of mind that represents distance, the way in which we have a mental representation of color in the mind, caused by mechanical properties in bodies but does not resemble them (88-89). But, Hatfield argues, “in nonhuman animals, the nonmental idea of distance [i.e., a state of the brain] serves the same role, but without … the mental experience of distance” (86). In neither case, though, does the “natural geometry” involve a rational calculation of distance.

Louis Rouquayrol is interested in “the role of the brain and the mind in Descartes’s account of the conduct of life” (97). More particularly, in his essay, “The Easiness of Habits: Brain, Freedom, and Conduct of Life in Descartes” (Chapter 6), he is concerned with the formation of habits. Rouquayrol begins by distinguishing between “rigid habits”, such as motor skills like playing a harp or working with tools, which humans share with animals, and “more flexible habits that require some application of the mind” (98), which are unique to humans. The main focus of the essay that follows is on rigid habits, which “depend on a complex causal relationship between the brain, which itself has its own habits, and other parts of the human body” (98).

Rouquayrol notes their specificity to particular tasks, the way in which they involve a deformation of the body and are thus irreversible, and their independence of mind in their exercise, even when the mind may have been initially required to instill those habits. The essay investigates in some detail the role of the brain and the movement of animal spirits in forming the rigid habits. Less attention is paid to “flexible intellectual habits” that “facilitate scientific operations” but also “facilitate decision-making or the implementation of a practical decision” (98, 108-109). However, “although a well-disposed brain is a necessary condition for rational conduct of life, it is by no means a sufficient one” (108). That is, when dealing with the more flexible habits, those that show the human adaptability of behavior to a wide variety of unpredictable circumstances, we must also appeal to mind.

In the last essay in Part 1 of the book, focused specifically on Descartes and his system, Ruidan She takes us in a somewhat different direction. In her essay, “Beyond the Brain: Descartes on the Initiation of Passions and Passionate Responses” (Chapter 7), She complains that recent work has overemphasized the body and “thus undermines the importance of Descartes’s original creation of the ‘mind-body’ union” (113). Her target is the idea that though the passions are strictly speaking in the mind, they are caused by events in the body alone, as are their effects on our behavior. In opposition to this, She argues

...that in Descartes’s primary case of passion, the action of the soul plays an indispensable role in the initiation of passions and their related bodily reactions, the causal effect of which can by no means be reduced to the function of the brain. (115)

She presents two ways in which the passions involve the intermediation of the soul. First, the soul can receive the emotion that constitutes the passion only after it has made judgments about a sensory object and imprinted the image of it on the brain through an act of imagination (115, 116-21). For example, consider a city in danger of being besieged by an enemy. A reasonable response is the passion of fear. She quotes a letter to Elisabeth (October 6, 1645): “The inhabitants at once make a judgment about the evil which may result to them: this judgment is an action of their soul and not a passion”. Different people may make different estimates of how likely the siege is, what its effects will be and how painful it will be. It is only after the judgment has been made that any of the inhabitants will come to be afraid, to whatever extent they are. But, Descartes notes to Elisabeth, “their souls can receive the emotion that constitutes the passion only after they have made the judgment” (AT IV 312, quoted on p. 116).^[1] And secondly, She argues that acting on a passion requires desire for Descartes. In Passions de l’âme §143, Descartes asserts that joy and sadness, love and hate don’t lead to action without the passion of desire, which Descartes distinguishes from the passion of love. Descartes continues:

Because these passions cannot lead us to perform any action except by means of the desire they produce, it is this desire which we should take particular care to control; and here lies the chief utility of morality. (Passions de l’âme §144, AT XI 436/CSMK I 379, quoted on p. 122)

But, She argues, on the basis of this passage, the passion of desire is under the control of the will, which requires a mind.

With this essay, Part 1 of the book ends, and we turn from the consideration of Descartes’s views to Book 2 and the wider consideration of the brain in Cartesianism and beyond.

The first essay in this section is Gideon Manning’s “Descartes’s Cardiovascular Science of the Brain” (Chapter 8). Manning’s story goes back to the ancients and the discovery of three distinct vascular systems in the human body: (a) the heart and the arteries; (b) the liver and the veins; (c) the brain and the nerves. This view, handed down to the early moderns in the writings of Galen, constituted the standard view when Harvey was a student. Harvey’s great accomplishment was, of course, the circulation of the blood. This required him to unite the first two of these vascular systems into one, where the heart was responsible for the circulation of blood both in the arteries and the veins (144).

Descartes, of course, accepted the circulation of the blood, though he differed from Harvey on the way the heart functioned. Descartes replaced the action of the heart as a muscle with the idea of a fire in the heart, which was responsible for circulation. However, Manning is interested not in that, but in the extension of the circulation model from the heart to the brain and the nervous system and from blood to animal spirits, on analogy with Harvey’s account of the circulation of the blood, what Manning calls a “cardiovascular inspired account of the brain and nerves” (152-53). In a way, though, the real hero of Manning’s story is Henricus Regius, the disciple who Descartes disowned but who eventually became an influential representative of the Cartesian school. Manning shows how Regius was able to confirm Descartes’s conjecture through observations of the neural circulation of a slug, an animal with a long history of medical uses (155-57).

Tad Schmaltz’s essay, “The Pineal Gland in Cartesianism” (Chapter 9) picks up the thread from earlier in the volume and takes the story of Descartes’s focus on the pineal gland into some of his later followers. Schmaltz begins before Descartes, with an account of pre-Cartesian views on the pineal gland and its functions. In ancient and medieval medicine, the brain was the site both of a kind of valve that regulated the distribution of what came to be known as “animal spirits” in later thinkers such as Descartes, a valve which some (though not Galen) identified with the pineal gland. And there was a common sense, an area of the brain which brought together the information collected from the various sense organs.

But, Schmaltz emphasizes, Descartes is original in joining the two functions and localizing them in one place, the pineal gland (168-70). Schmaltz then follows the fortunes of the pineal gland in some of Descartes’s later followers. Regius followed Descartes pretty closely in this issue, as did Louis de La Forge. But Descartes’s account of the pineal gland was dealt a large blow in 1665 when the Danish anatomist Nicolas Steno (Niels Steenson) delivered a series of lectures in which, on the basis of his anatomical investigations of the human brain, he demonstrated that the actual physical structure of the pineal gland and its place in the brain made it impossible for it to do what Descartes had claimed it did (175-76). Though La Forge attempted to answer Steno’s objections to the pineal gland theories, other Cartesians did not. Nicolas Malebranche’s Recherche de la Vérité shifts away from the centrality of the pineal gland without proposing a replacement. On the other hand, Pierre-Sylvain Regis did. Schmaltz concludes his story by noting that “the fate of Descartes’s pineal gland theory provides a particularly clear illustration of the plasticity of Cartesianism…” (186).

The final group of three essays take us in a rather different direction. Like the other essays in Part 2, they deal with later responses to Descartes’s views on the brain. But in this case we are dealing not with the reactions of Descartes’s immediate followers and opponents but with the relations between Descartes’s science of the brain and current neuroscience. These papers raise issues of a rather different kind than the earlier papers in the volume.

The first of these essays is “The Figure of Descartes in Neuroscience” (Chapter 10) by Jean-Gaël Barbara. This essay is the most general of the three last chapters. Its general goal is to “address the theoretical relations between Descartes’s ideas and present neuroscientific knowledge in order to show their relevance” (193). Barbara begins by summarizing the history of the reception of Descartes’s views on the brain and its functioning. Though Barbara notes some interest in this aspect of Descartes’s thought in the nineteenth century and early twentieth centuries, he claims that “until the end of the 1990’s, historians of the neurosciences rather have neglected Descartes” (200). Barbara notes that a number of recent writers “have contributed to specify how the Cartesian corpus offers an epistemology combining dualism and the union (the third primitive notion), enabling a suitable dialogue with neuroscience and its history” (201).

What this dialogue seems to involve is “drawing parallels with past and more recent conceptions, focusing on the operations of the mechanisms as explanations of functions defined at the level of the human body or of the subject” (202). Having laid out the history of historical and philosophical engagement with the “embodied Descartes”, Barbara goes on to discuss some of these parallels in more detail. The issues that he discusses include, among others, the physiology of sensation, the phenomenon of the phantom limb, the question of reflex action and the neuroscientific study of the emotions. In these specific cases, the project seems to be to “better understand how certain aspects of Descartes’s work may have influenced the evolution of physiology and psychophysiology, often in an underground and unobtrusive way” (205). So far as I can see, the point of the project, as Barbara frames it, is to read Descartes’s writings on the brain and the nervous system through the lens of contemporary neuroscience, to see the extent to which Descartes can be seen as anticipating in some way what we now believe about the brain.

The final two essays in the book focus on more specific issues relating to the Cartesian brain and contemporary neuroscience. Damien Lacroux’s contribution, “Intellectual Emotion, Passion, and the relevance of Cartesianism to Cognitive Science” (Chapter 11) concerns the relation between certain aspects of Descartes’s view on the emotions and passions of the soul and the way they are treated in contemporary neuroscience. Lacroux is particularly concerned with the distinction between intellectual emotions and passionate emotions. An intellectual emotion is one that is motivated by reason alone. For example, “if the soul perceived that there are many very fine things to be known about nature, its will would be infallibly impelled to love the knowledge of those things” (AT IV 602/CSMK III 306).

This kind of purely rational love is completely different from the kind of love Descartes calls “sensual or sensuous”, which “is nothing but a confused thought, aroused in the soul by some motion of the nerves”, which is involved in the kind of love we have for sensible things (AT IV 602-03/CSMK III 306). Lacroux then investigates whether “the problem of intellectual emotions is still present in the field of cognitive science and, if so, in what form it manifests itself” (232). After investigating the question, Lacroux concludes that there are some similarities between Descartes’s distinction and a distinction that William James drew between what he called “subtle emotions” and “emotions in the strict sense of the term” (232), which arise from sense experience. However, he also points out that the relation between Descartes and James is weakened by a number of factors. Lacroux also points out similarity between Descartes’s intellectual emotions and so-called “simulation loops” as treated by Antonio Damasio (237) and Joseph LeDoux (242).

But again, while there is a certain resemblance between Descartes’s ideas and contemporary treatments, the relationship is somewhat distant. Unlike in the case of Barbara, we are not reading Descartes through the lens of contemporary neuroscience but contemporary neuroscience through the lens of Descartes. And I’m not entirely sure what we are learning by doing so.

Finally, the last essay, Jean-Claude Dupont’s “The Cartesian Brain and the History of Memory Traces” (Chapter 12) again relates Descartes’s account of the brain with contemporary neuroscience, this time focusing on the issue of memory, structured around the work of John Sutten on memory in Descartes and contemporary neuroscience. Dupont begins with a brief history of what was to become a widespread account of memory. It begins with the idea of tupos, a physical imprint, deriving from experience that is the basis of memory. This idea, going back to classical antiquity shaped many approaches to memory, including Descartes’s (248-50). In Descartes, the physical imprint is a result of the motion of the animal spirits. When experience causes the animal spirits to follow specific paths through the brain, certain pores are expanded, making it easier for animal spirits to be conducted in one way rather than another at later times (251). Dupont notes how Sutton traces further developments of Descartes’s ideas in later figures, including Malebranche, and opponents like Digby, Hooke and Boyle (254). Dupont and Sutton see the importance of Descartes’ position in an important transformation of the idea of the localized tupos:

Descartes assigned physiological significance to animal spirits, facilitating the transition from static, archival metaphors to dynamic, distributed representations. According to Descartes, memory isn’t merely a repository of images or an internal lexicon. (255)

For Descartes, and for the many who followed his lead, memory is not a discrete image or mark in the brain but the tendency of the animal spirits to flow in one way rather than another, a tendency that results from experience. Sutton then sees the seventeenth century as a period characterized by a “competition between two memory models, which in turn gave rise to divergent interpretations of brain functioning: the distributed model rooted in Descartes’s ideas, and the localized model” (256). Sutton then traces this to modern philosophical and neuropsychological thought about memory and suggests that “the modern notion that memory is a distinct pattern of activation—and that memories are reconstructed rather than merely stored—traces its historical roots back to Descartes” (257). In this way, he sees Descartes as the father of modern connectionism, a recent view that grounds cognition in general in neural networks, nodes (neurons) connected with one another.^[2]

Though he finds Sutton’s story, a direct line from Descartes to contemporary neuroscience interesting and illuminating, Dupont is somewhat skeptical; he suggests that the idea of a discrete and localizable memory trace (now called an “engram”) does not disappear and continues as an option in the philosophy of mind and in neuroscience (261-63). Dupont ends his article by sketching out some of the very complex path by which we have come to where we arrived.

In the end, I find the more purely historical chapters of the book more satisfying than the attempt to relate Descartes’s brain to modern neuroscience. To those of us with a historical bent, it is obvious what the more purely historical chapters are trying to do. And while some of the more historical chapters in this volume are more successful than others, the project is well defined and the criteria for success is generally agreed upon. But I find it more difficult to assess the final three chapters.

Given the historiographical upheavals of the last forty or fifty years, it is treacherous to pontificate about what we are supposed to be doing when we write the history of philosophy or history of science. But it seems to me, attempting to understand the past on its own terms should be one of the primary goals. It is interesting to note certain correspondences between earlier views and the ones that are held in contemporary neuroscience, as if to pat Descartes on the back and congratulate him for having seen something we now believe. But it is just as important—if not more so—to see what is distinctively Cartesian about Descartes’s views and how they differ from what we now believe, to see Descartes’s view of human physiology through his own eyes and the eyes of his contemporaries and to appreciate not what he may have anticipated in our views, but what was distinctively his. When you work on Descartes’s physics, it makes sense to relate what he is doing to what Newton was doing: they are in the same world, and Newton is talking directly to Descartes. Putting them together enables you to see what Descartes missed and how Newton reshaped Descartes’s world. But to try to relate either of them to the world of quantum mechanics doesn’t really make sense: their worlds are too different.

In his essay, Dupont raises some of these same questions. In fact, one might say that it was precisely the problem of understanding why someone might want to compare Descartes’s brain with contemporary neuroscience that may have motivated the decision to focus his essay on John Sutton and his project, which involves both contemporary and Cartesian views of memory. While Dupont obviously admires Sutton’s approach, he also recognizes that it is, in a way, problematic. He notes that Sutton “posits a continuous progression of the [non-localized distributed] memory trace concept from Descartes to contemporary connectionism, seeing it as an evolving journey” (261) and leaves out altogether the parallel development of the localized memory trace idea through the same period. Dupont cites historian of philosophy Gabriel Alban-Zapata as holding that Sutton was being deliberately anachronistic in his interpretation (259) and goes so far as to raise the question as to whether it is “appropriate to retrospectively brand Descartes as the predecessor of any contemporary idea” (258). But in the end, though he disagrees with Sutton’s historical account, Dupont defends Sutton’s program:

[Sutton’s deliberate anachronism] might unveil historical nuances previously overlooked by traditional historians. Such an angle can illuminate elements in ancient texts, which might have remained hidden without this interpretative shift. The endeavor to draw parallels and construct homologies can be a fruitful exercise for audacious historians. By revisiting Descartes through this lens, they can weave him back into the tapestry of neuroscience and cognitive science history, unveiling fresh interpretations. (259)

What I think Dupont has in mind here is that, though perhaps somewhat anachronistic and something of a distortion of the history, Sutton does allow us to see something about Descartes (and his place in the history of brain science) that we might otherwise have missed: Descartes’s account of memory and the role of the motion of the animal spirits in memory frees us from the tyranny of the localized trace model and opens up a much different way of thinking about memory that leads us eventually to connectionism and neural network theories of memory, something that we might not have otherwise appreciated about the Cartesian brain. Though reading Descartes through connectionism may be anachronistic, in a way, it also allows us to see in Descartes the beginnings of the idea of a dynamic and non-localized account of memory.

Altogether, this book is a welcome addition to the new literature on Descartes. In expanding our conception of philosophy to include medicine and natural philosophy, the audience is exposed to an important, but neglected, corner of his thought. These essays help us see Descartes as his contemporaries saw him, a figure who embraced the embodied person, mind and body, mind and brain.

REFERENCES

Buckner, Cameron and James Garson, "Connectionism", The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2025 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/spr2025/entries/connectionism/>.

Daniel Garber, “Mind, Body and the Laws of Nature in Descartes and Leibniz,” in Garber, Descartes Embodied: Reading Cartesian Philosophy through Cartesian Science (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001).

René Descartes, Œuvres de Descartes, C. Adam and P. Tannery (eds), 11 vols. (Paris: Vrin, 1996).

René Descartes, The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, John Cottingham, Robert, Stoothoff, Dugald Murdoch, and Anthony Kenny (trans.), 3 vols. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1984-91).