The Enlightenment’s Most Dangerous Woman: Émilie Du Châtelet and the Making of Modern Philosophy

Émilie Du Châtelet (1706-1749) possessed an extraordinary mind and extraordinary ambition. During her lifetime and for much of the century that followed, her name was synonymous with scientific accomplishment. She knew and corresponded with leading mathematicians and scientists throughout Europe; her Institutions de physique (1740; revised second edition 1742), was widely read and reviewed; significant portions found themselves (sometimes with, sometimes without attribution) in Diderot and d’Alembert’s Encyclopédie, the so-called “war machine of the Enlightenment”. How, then, did she largely fade from view, relegated in intellectual history to the role of “Voltaire’s mistress”, and almost entirely forgotten in the history of philosophy and mathematics? Janiak’s detailed, deeply contextualized reading of the Institutions goes hand in hand with critique of a historiographical tradition.

Recent decades have seen a steep rise in scholarly attention to her work and appreciation of her achievement as a philosopher of science. Janiak acknowledges and incorporates the insights of previous scholarship, but notes that traditional distortions often linger.

The first chapter, “The Rise and Fall of Émilie Du Châtelet”, deftly treats the salient features of Du Châtelet’s personal life and relationship with Voltaire, while focusing primarily on her intellectual views. The years when the two were in residence at her chateau de Cirey and receiving visits from leading men in mathematics, science, and philosophy, the “Émiliens”, as Voltaire called them, were idyllic in many ways, but their emotional and intellectual partnership could not mask substantive disagreements. Voltaire had become a fervent disciple of Newton, and although Du Châtelet helped him with the technical portions of his popularizing work, Les Élements de la philosophie de Newton (1738), she would never accept the notion that any single individual or philosophical position held the key to absolute truth. Du Châtelet’s explicit rejection of intellectual discipleship in her preface to the Institutions is a key theme in Janiak’s study. The chapter juxtaposes the widespread diffusion of her ideas in the eighteenth century with her subsequent erasure, asking, “How did this happen?”

To answer that question, Janiak offers a detailed account of the intellectual environment of early eighteenth-century science and philosophy. Chapter 2, “What Was the Scientific Revolution?” interrogates the catch-all notion of the “Newtonian paradigm” to show the complexities of the emergent new science and the variations and disagreements among even those who considered themselves Newton’s allies. Du Châtelet may have been the first, as Janiak claims, to refer to the new science as a “revolution”, but like political revolutions, it was messy and unsettled. Janiak is at great pains to sort out the layers and the evolution of the debates, which ranged from technical mathematical questions to broad metaphysical issues; he tracks the contributions of thinkers from Descartes to Euler and, of course, Leibniz. Du Châtelet’s insight, in Janiak’s view, was to see connections and relations between opposing “sides” and to understand that the heart of the dispute concerned “not only gravity, the forces of nature, and absolute space” but rather “the deeper issue of which principles science should use to understand nature” (Janiak, 65). Her goal in the Institutions would be to test the limits of physics and metaphysics, and to consider the purview of each.

The central chapter, “Du Châtelet’s Vision of Science and Philosophy” explores this approach through a reading of the Institutions. Janiak walks us through Du Châtelet’s careful account of key questions. She points out the metaphysical dimension of the ongoing debate as to whether gravity was a property of matter or essential to it, critiques Locke’s defense of mechanical philosophy, and reviews the debate over absolute space in Leibniz, Clarke, and Euler. Her attention to the intricacies of scientific arguments has all too often led readers less attuned to the stakes of the debates to wrongly assume that the Institutions was simply an exposition of others’ ideas. Two qualities stand out in her approach, however: her ability to find middle ground and mutual benefit between supposedly opposite views and her steadfast refusal of discipleship. As she says in the preface to the Institutions, a passage that Janiak places as an epigraph to his study: “Each philosopher has seen something, and none has seen everything; there is no book so bad that nothing can be learned from it, and none so good that one may not improve it.” It is ultimately this attitude that rendered her “dangerous”.

Chapter 4, “The Enlightenment’s Most Famous Woman”, takes up the social and institutional mechanisms for the diffusion of knowledge, providing insight into how Du Châtelet’s work became known. As Janiak notes, although Newton and other British thinkers held university appointments, the primary loci for the spread of scientific ideas were academies of science. Like the universities, they were largely closed to women. In France, women’s cultural and intellectual influence was most prominent in salons. These were key institutions. Distinguished salon hostesses such as the marquise de Lambert and later Suzanne Necker and the marquise du Deffand guided discussions and promoted the careers of their (male) guests, but although these women corresponded widely and often wrote extensively, they all too often refrained from publication as unseemly; with few exceptions, their writings would be known posthumously. Salon culture did not offer an outlet for Du Châtelet’s ambition; she turned her eyes to the world of the academies, with their meetings, publications, and sponsored research projects.

She also eschewed the popularizing mode, recognizing that although established male intellectuals like Voltaire, Bernard de Fontenelle, and Francesco Algarotti could succeed with such works, as a woman she risked being taken for a lightweight. Although nominally addressed to her son and given a pedagogical framework, the Institutions was a full-fledged treatise aimed at resolving critical controversies in philosophy and science. It led her straight into a public debate with none other than the Perpetual Secretary of the Académie des sciences, Jean-Jacques Dortous de Mairan on the question of vis viva, “living force”. Du Châtelet knew Mairan socially and had spoken favorably of him in her earlier work, so her critique evidently came as an unpleasant surprise.

I am less inclined than Janiak to think that she deliberately “set her trap” or “ensnared” Mairan (123-124) by provoking him into a rejoinder.^[1] I think it more likely that her thinking had evolved as she continued to study and engage with her material. In any case, Mairan seriously underestimated her abilities; his letter treats her like a foolish dilletante easily influenced by others, whereas her response exemplifies her command of the issues. Janiak’s discussion is especially helpful in understanding the vis viva controversy and its progression in arguments by Descartes, Newton, Leibniz, Clarke, and d’Alembert. Far too many accounts, in his view, have clouded the issue by assimilating vis viva to anachronistic concepts such as kinetic energy. His assessment might stand as a summary of his overall approach: “Reading historical figures through the lens of where scientific research eventually ended up, long after they had died, dooms us to confusion” (129).

A key vector for Du Châtelet’s work came after her death, when extended passages from the Institutions were incorporated in the Encyclopédie, primarily in articles by Samuel Formey. (It is worth noting that Du Châtelet was far from the only writer whose work found its way into the Encyclopédie at a time predating modern notions of copyright.) Janiak’s careful documentation of both acknowledged and unacknowledged borrowing blends neatly into the next chapter, “The Enlightenment’s Most Dangerous Woman: or the Making of Modern Philosophy”, in which we see how thinkers who knew Du Châtelet’s work very well, such as Formey and Johann Jacob Brucker, author of the highly influential mid-eighteenth-century Critical History of Philosophy, dropped her from their accounts of modern philosophers. We come back to the question of the opening chapter: why?

Although it is convenient to blame the exclusion of women from the philosophical canon on stodgy nineteenth-century academics, Janiak points to a group often taken as the voice of progressive modernity, the philosophes. He notes d’Alembert’s Preliminary Discourse to the Encyclopédie, with its list of culture heroes, beginning with Descartes, who questioned received dogmas, and to Diderot’s article “Éclectisme”, which borrows heavily from Brucker and “reads like a manifesto”:

The eclectic is a philosopher who tramples on prejudice, tradition, seniority, universal consent, and authority, in a word, all that captivates the mind. (...) The sectarian is a man who embraces the doctrine of a philosopher; the eclectic, on the contrary, is a man who recognizes no master. (175)

In other words, although there had always been philosophers, a modern philosopher is distinguished by his independence.

Here is the problem in a nutshell: Du Châtelet consistently refused to embrace any single “doctrine”. Her intellectual independence made her, in Janiak’s word, “dangerous”. She could be—and was—treated seriously as a philosopher, but it was simply inconceivable to even the most radical philosophes that a woman could be a “modern” philosopher in the fullest sense. The tendency in her day and in our own, to pigeonhole her as a “Leibnizian” and sometimes as a “Newtonian” reflects her silent exclusion from “modernity”. For Janiak, this exclusion goes deeper than the conventional sexism of Kant’s remark that exceptional women like Du Châtelet and the great Hellenist Anne Dacier (no stranger to misogynistic attacks herself) “might as well also have a beard” (172). Rather, it is the way in which masculinity has been unconsciously embedded in the concept of the “modern philosopher” since the birth of modern philosophy and continuing today. “Even today, major works designed to introduce students to the history of western philosophy echo the eighteenth century’s common view that a woman can be a philosopher only if she is seen as following some other thinker” (184).

In conclusion, Janiak underscores his double point. First, Du Châtelet brought novel insights into the science of her day and a view of philosophy and science as open-ended processes—the esprit systématique praised by d’Alembert, as opposed to a dogmatic esprit de systèmes. Second, her erasure from the canon of modern philosophy reveals a deep-seated masculinist unconscious whose effects are still with us. Janiak offers Du Châtelet’s “philosophy for freethinkers” as a needed antidote.

Janiak invites us to reimagine historiography. Although he points to Brucker as the originator of the idea of “modern philosophy”, it would be worth going further to interrogate the emergence of the concept of modernity itself. The French word moderne occurs in vernacular works of the late Middle Ages to refer to anything from the present or recent past, but in the eighteenth century, it had acquired a distinctly polemical edge from association with the major controversy from 1687-1716 over the relative value of “modern” versus classical culture. The philosophes would—in certain respects, at least—view themselves as the inheritors of the Moderns. In French, the noun modernité does not emerge until the nineteenth century, marking the subterranean evolution of the concept from adjectival attribute to a concrete substantive that lent emphasis to practices of periodization.

The Enlightenment’s Most Dangerous Woman can and deserves to be read as a highly instructive exploration of eighteenth-century science, as well as an important methodological statement for the history of philosophy. It is also worth considering Du Châtelet’s work and legacy in the context of other women writers and intellectuals of the period, for whom (like Anne Dacier) she would often represent a model of female accomplishment and the larger story of their relationship to what we call “the canon.”