Martin Wilkinson’s book The Ethics of Public Health Paternalism is a normative analysis of paternalistic governmental policies within liberal democracies that aim at improving adults’ health. Wilkinson is largely critical of paternalistic interventions, especially preventive interventions that restrict choice by imposing costs on or removing unhealthy options, and of arguments in favor of these interventions commonly advanced within public health. Wilkinson’s critiques primarily focus on interventions relating to tobacco, alcohol, and obesity and orbit two main points. The first is that, contrary to what is often tacitly assumed within public health, health is neither a supreme value nor the same as wellbeing; improvements in health do not necessarily lead to improvements in wellbeing, and, in fact, interventions that make people healthier can make them all-things-considered worse off. The second point is that paternalistic interventions can problematically interfere with autonomy even when they improve wellbeing. With some exceptions (the most notable being tobacco regulations), Wilkinson argues that, even assuming they improve health, many common paternalistic interventions are unjustified because (i) there is insufficient evidence to support the claim that these policies improve the wellbeing of enough of the people they are intended to benefit, and (ii) these policies infringe on autonomy to a greater degree than is usually appreciated.
The book is written in a standard analytic philosophy style and is a perspicuous contribution to philosophical debates about paternalism. Wilkinson writes from the perspective of a trained philosopher who has spent time embedded in multidisciplinary academic departments that include public and population health scholars. While the book includes global examples, Wilkinson’s personal perspective is shaped by the public health systems he knows best, which have their own distinct flavor of public health practice and scope of authority. The book, or part of it, could function well in a public health ethics class. A prime audience would be a public health practitioner or policymaker who is curious about ethics and has taken some philosophical coursework.
The most important point in the book is the discussion of healthism, defined as the tendency to overvalue health and safety (14). Health is one important value that contributes to a good life. Health is instrumental to many important ends. But the relationship between health and wellbeing is not always straightforward and varies across persons. Intuitively, health is important to someone who wants to spend a long, active life outdoors and less important to an audiophile who, upon reflection, most wants to spend her weekends listening to records and getting high on heroin. Wilkinson shows how many public health writers effectively overlook values that can compete with health (such as pleasure or bonhomie) and assume that promoting health is on balance good for people, while threats to health are on balance bad for them. Concomitant with this is the assumption that people who choose unhealthy options choose mistakenly.
‘Wellbeing’ refers to how well someone’s life is going for them. Wilkinson bases his healthism arguments on a preference-based account of wellbeing, which says that a person’s wellbeing is determined by their ultimate preferences for their life (42-44). Subjectivist views like this contrast with objectivist accounts, which say that a person’s wellbeing is determined by the extent to which certain objectively determined values, such as love and knowledge, are present in their life. Wilkinson’s account doesn’t feel airtight. But this does not matter because all plausible views of wellbeing imply that sometimes making someone healthier renders them on balance worse off. Outlawing heroin may make the audiophile’s life worse, even as it improves her health and extends her life, because it frustrates her ultimate preferences or deprives her of objective values associated with her lifestyle.
Wilkinson argues that there is usually insufficient evidence to show that real-world paternalistic interventions make people better off by making them healthier. Wilkinson focuses on efforts relating to tobacco, alcohol, and unhealthy foods. To determine whether such efforts promote wellbeing, we need to know whether unhealthy choices align with the chooser’s wellbeing. There are reasons to think unhealthy choices may be misaligned with wellbeing, but they are inconclusive. For example, tempting or deceptive advertisements for unhealthy products abound, which suggests that some people may choose unhealthy behaviors because they are tempted or misled; however, evidence about the precise effects of advertising is incomplete (149-156). Wilkinson argues that a good practical test for whether unhealthy choices align with a person’s wellbeing involves determining whether they all-things-considered regret their behavior (77-79). There is insufficient evidence to show that most drinkers regret their drinking habits (89-94) or most unhealthy eaters their eating habits (94-99). However, there is evidence to show that cigarette smokers regret having started smoking (81-89). This suggests that smoking does not align with smokers’ preferences and that smokers are making a prudential mistake. Wilkinson concludes that interventions designed to curb smoking probably promote wellbeing. Existing evidence does not support the same conclusion for alcohol and unhealthy foods.
While Wilkinson’s remarks about healthism are important, he ignores some considerations that complicate his picture. For one, Wilkinson focuses on physical health and speaks little about mental health, despite the fact that public health is concerned with both. For instance, the World Health Organization has, since 1948, included mental health as a core tenet of health (Bickenbach, 2017). Since there is a tighter connection between mental health and wellbeing, the assumption that promoting health, broadly construed, promotes wellbeing is more reasonable than Wilkinson’s remarks suggest. Another complicating consideration is that some subfields of public health are significantly more sensitive to the hazards of healthism than the subfields Wilkinson focuses on. For example, sexual and reproductive health professionals have been increasingly integrating pleasure and choice into their conception of sexual wellbeing for decades (Gruskin and Kismödi, 2020; Mitchell et al., 2021); another is that public health professionals concerned about social media use acknowledge that health risks, such as sleep disturbances and depression, should be weighed against potential benefits, such as social connection and opportunities for creative expression (Social Media and Youth Mental Health, 2025). These complications suggest that the profession is already more alive to Wilkinson’s healthism critiques than he acknowledges.
Wilkinson’s second main point is that many paternalistic interventions threaten to infringe on autonomy without producing a sufficiently compensatory benefit to wellbeing. Wilkinson views autonomy as the capacity to make competent decisions within a sphere of personal sovereignty (102-105). He levies incisive critiques at several arguments that purport to show paternalistic interventions need not interfere with autonomy. The most interesting parts of this discussion concern self-binding, nudges, and inequity.
Some paternalistic interventions are contingent upon the direct consent of a target who, like Ulysses on the mast, seeks to bind herself against anticipated mistakes (cf. Parfit, 1984, 326-329). Wilkinson illustrates with the example of a New Zealand law that empowers self-described problem gamblers to make it the case that they are not permitted to enter a casino (Gambling Act 2003 §310). Other voluntary self-exclusion schemes elsewhere in the world address gambling problems (Hopfgartner et al., 2023), suicide by firearm (Barks et al., 2025), and opioid use (Massachusetts Bureau of Substance Addiction Services 2018). Wilkinson argues that self-binding interventions do not raise deep autonomy concerns and, as an added advantage, can rest on an individual’s judgement about the particular relationship between their health and wellbeing. In principle, then, he approves. However, Wilkinson is skeptical that people would want to bind themselves through such schemes and so is not optimistic about them in practice (126-132).
We suspect that self-binding schemes would be more utilized if they were better known, tested, and normalized. In principle, a public health apparatus could enable citizens to easily bind themselves in fine-grained ways that are tailored to help them avoid mistakes and more effectively pursue their ends. For example, a paternalistic policy could, in principle, be designed to enable a person to make it illegal for bars to sell them more than two drinks on weekdays. Such creative possibilities deserve more discussion.
Another kind of paternalistic intervention involves nudges, which are standardly understood as modifications of “any aspect of the choice architecture that alters people’s behavior in a predictable way without forbidding any options or significantly changing their economic incentives” (Thaler and Sunstein, 2008, 6). Because nudges enable targets to opt out of their influence, Wilkinson thinks nudges do not infringe on autonomy and are, in this sense, a promising paternalistic tool.
Again, however, the picture Wilkinson paints is more complex than his focus on certain subfields suggests. While it is plausible to say the state may alter the choice architecture of decisions about purchasing unhealthy consumables, it is less clear when these interventions are permissible in more intimate spheres that Wilkinson hardly discusses, such as sexuality or family life. Moreover, it is not always possible to opt out from the presence of nudges, and repeated exposure over long periods of time may feel noxious (especially in intimate spheres) or increase the chances that people act against their preferences. Consequently, Wilkinson’s remarks about nudges in public health feel somewhat incomplete.
Wilkinson’s arguments concerning paternalism and equity will feel especially cutting to public health readers. Health inequalities between the rich and poor are generally viewed by public health as a product or form of inequity. Unhealthy choices exacerbate these inequalities. Many public health writers conclude that paternalistic interventions on unhealthy choices decrease inequity. Wilkinson’s healthism critiques problematize this argument. A poor person might choose an unhealthy option because it is the prudentially best option available to them; interventions that remove or discourage such an option would likely make the person worse off and possibly increase inequity. Generally speaking, paternalistic prohibitions improve poor people’s wellbeing only on the assumption that poor people are incompetent choosers. Yet this assumption, in Wilkinson’s view, is unjustified by current evidence. Wilkinson thinks it better to address inequity through increasing people’s options, e.g., in the form of cash payments, instead of prohibitions (196-210).
Wilkinson’s critique is compelling. The idea that poor people have the most to gain from having options removed arguably expresses the sentiment that poor people are the worst choosers. This sentiment is classist and fits conveniently into a neoliberal ideology that says the poor are poor because they are worse. Paternalistic prohibitions that are specifically intended to help the poor, such as regressive taxes on unhealthy drinks or prohibitions on varieties of products mostly consumed by the poor, e.g., menthol cigarettes (Caraballo and Asman, 2011), are part of the architecture of inequity that public health advocates want to ameliorate.
This book is written as many sectors of public health shift away from a simplistic focus on health and safety towards more complex, multidisciplinary, and holistic understandings of wellbeing (Lee and Lee, 2025). These shifts are occurring along multiple dimensions, including embracing mental, social, and spiritual health within the purview of public health (Long et al., 2024); popularizing harm reduction techniques; increasing commitment to political and economic advocacy, e.g., universal basic income; centering new perspectives on health and wellbeing from disability advocates; and focusing on Quality Adjusted Life Years (QALYs) beyond simple life expectancy. Wilkinson seems to be moving with the tide.
Overall, Wilkinson underscores important considerations about assumptions baked into public health and points to research gaps that could be illuminated with thoughtful studies interrogating people’s motivations, regrets, and preferences. The book concludes with an ethical checklist for public health interventions. This may be the most interesting and constructive portion of the book for public health practitioners. The checklist is reflective of how, as Wilkinson says, skepticism need not be opposition.
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ACKNOWLEDGEMENTS
Thanks to Jacob Sparks and Martin Wilkinson for comments on a previous draft.