‘We are in favour of making people happy, but neutral about making happy people’, Narveson famously quipped (Narveson 1976, 73). In her book, M.A. Roberts transforms this snappy slogan into a thorough and innovative theory of population ethics. She defends two ideas that initially seem to be in tension, namely, the basic maximizing intuition, according to which we ought to produce the best consequences, and the basic existential intuition, according to which we should be neutral about creating happy people. These ideas seem to be in tension, since it seems that we can produce good consequences either by making people happy or by creating happy people (Here and elsewhere I follow Roberts in using ‘being happy’ and ‘being unhappy’ as synonymous with ‘having positive wellbeing’ and ‘having negative wellbeing’, respectively). In either case, we produce more good, more happiness. The rest of the book is devoted to explaining how, initial impressions notwithstanding, the basic existential intuition is compatible with the basic maximizing intuition, properly understood, and how the resulting theory solves several puzzles.
Roberts makes some crucial assumptions that together delineate the discussion. The first is nonexistence comparability: we can make wellbeing comparisons between a person’s existence and non-existence (xx). The second is about accessibility (25–6). In all cases she considers, value is assigned only to futures that are accessible relative to each other. One future y is accessible relative to another x, if agents in x can bring about y, with some non-zero probability. (This accessibility restriction will be implicit in my formulations of her principles below.) Merely logically possible futures are not considered. She adds that if two futures are accessible to each other, then this is an essential feature of them. The third assumption is the connection thesis: there is a close connection between how we compare futures with respect to betterness and the evaluation of the actions that bring those futures about (26).
Equipped with these assumptions, she sets out to articulate what she calls a person-based consequentialist approach to population ethics. No complete theory is offered, but she defends nine substantive moral principles and many more conceptual principles, such as the transitivity of betterness, that together put some flesh on the consequentialist bones. The moral principles are proposed as solutions to five different existence puzzles. Along the way, she rejects some popular alternative moral principles. Since space is limited, I will focus on two of the puzzles and Roberts’ solutions to them. These puzzles are well-known in population ethics, and they are instructive since some of the principles she defends here are developed further when she discusses the other puzzles.
The first puzzle is the asymmetry puzzle. Intuitively, it is wrong to create an unhappy person, but not obligatory to create a happy one, other things being equal. But why does the unhappy person’s life matter when the happy person’s life does not? Roberts convincingly criticises accounts that assume the key to the answer is to make distinctions between people on the basis of their existential status, for example, whether they are actual or non-actual, or whether they are necessary (exist in all accessible futures) or contingent (exist only in some accessible futures). Instead, Roberts’ answer hinges on a distinction between ordinary and existential losses (57). Ordinary losses are those we bear in futures in which we exist, whereas existential losses are those we bear in futures in which we never exist. Roberts claims that only ordinary losses have moral significance.
To explicate this difference in moral significance, Roberts introduces two principles, the existence condition and the Pareto reduction principle. Somewhat simplified (and seeing it only as a principle of worseness), the existence condition says:
if x is worse than y, then there is someone in x and for whom x is worse than y, or there is a third accessible future z that is better for this person than x. (59)
(The second disjunct in the consequent is not relevant to the first puzzle, but it is relevant to the second, as we will see.) This means that if we can choose between creating a happy person and not doing so, without affecting anybody else’s wellbeing, not creating the person cannot be worse than creating her, since if she is not created, there is no one who exists for whom creating her is better. If not creating her is not morally worse than doing so, then not creating her is not wrong (given a plausible reading of the connection thesis). If it is not wrong, it must be permissible. Moreover, creating the person cannot be obligatory, since we are permitted to refrain from doing so. We have thus explained the first part of the asymmetry, that we are permitted but not obligated to create a happy person, other things being equal.
The existence condition is silent on whether it is wrong to create an unhappy person, since it only provides a necessarycondition of worseness. Here Roberts employs the second principle, the Pareto reduction principle. Somewhat simplified it says:
x is morally worse than y, if each person in y also exists in x, x is worse for at least one person in x, and there is no person in y for whom x is better than y. (64)
This implies that it is wrong to create an unhappy person, other things being equal. If the unhappy person is created, then there is someone for whom this alternative is worse, the unhappy person. Since everything else is equal, the other conjuncts in the antecedent are satisfied.
The second puzzle is the Pareto-puzzle. If the basic existential intuition is right, then it seems that option A—not creating Charlotte—is equally as good as option B—creating Charlotte with a happy life. But suppose we have a third option, C—making Charlotte even happier. Surely, C is better than B, which would make her less happy. But C cannot be better than A, if we assume the basic existential intuition. This leads to contradiction, since if B is as good as A, and C is better than B, C must be better than A, (assuming transitivity of ‘at least as good’, which Roberts does not question).
Robert’s solution is to argue that B is worse than A. Here, the relevance of the second disjunct of the consequent in the existence condition becomes relevant. Without this disjunct, we would have to say that B cannot be worse than A, since there is no one in B for whom B is worse than A. However, the existence condition does not say that B is worse than A. Roberts shows that the existence condition implies that A is equally as good as C, and the Pareto reduction principle implies that C is better than B. Assuming betterness is coherent, it follows that B is worse than A. Given the connection thesis, we can then say that A and C are both permissible and B is wrong. This means that whether one alternative is better than another cannot always be decided by comparing only those two alternatives. Sometimes a comparison with a third accessible alternative is necessary.
In her discussion of the third puzzle, the addition puzzle, she shows that this feature of her view is compatible with assigning stable values to alternatives. In a nutshell, the idea is that the value of an alternative is the sum of the adjusted wellbeing of those who exist in it (plus zero wellbeing for the non-existent). Charlotte’s adjusted wellbeing in C is zero, because her wellbeing is maximized in this alternative. Her adjusted wellbeing in A is identical to her zero wellbeing there as a non-existent. Her adjusted wellbeing in B is -n, for some natural number n. We thus have an assignment of values that corresponds to the qualitative verdicts that B is worse than A (-n < 0), C is better than B (0 > -n), and A is equally as good as C (both are 0). Since Roberts assumes that whether an alternative is accessible to another is an essential feature of these alternatives, the value of an alternative cannot change.
There is much to admire in this book. While others defend person-based theories of population ethics, Roberts stands out by the thoroughness and originality of her approach. Her insistence on a consequentialist framework in which alternatives have stable values is unprecedented. Other person-based approaches tend to be deontological or tolerant of some instability of the value of alternatives. That said, some of her arguments and ideas are complex and require an attentive reader with some background in the basics of population ethics. The subtitle of her book is better understood as an advanced introduction to population ethics.
I will now turn to my critical comments. The first is about nonexistence comparability. As she admits in an appendix, whether we can make wellbeing comparisons between existence and nonexistence is controversial. She claims that you have zero wellbeing in a world in which you do not exist. This is controversial if zero wellbeing is equated with a neutral wellbeing level, for then we have the problem of a missing subject: there is no one for whom things are neutral. The way Roberts addresses this issue in the appendix A suggests that she does not identify zero wellbeing with neutral wellbeing. She draws an analogy: To say there is no sugar in the kitchen is to say there is zero sugar there. But then her claim that you have zero wellbeing in a world in which you do not exist is not controversial. Everyone agrees that there is no amount or level of your wellbeing in that world. However, this makes her talk about existential losses of wellbeing misleading. In the ordinary sense, to lose wellbeing is to be worse off than you would be otherwise. But to be worse off in one state than in another is to have a lower level of wellbeing in that state than in the other.
My second comment is about the restriction to accessible alternatives. All principles are formulated in terms of accessible alternatives. Does that mean that Roberts thinks that merely logically possible futures lack value? It is true that only the values of accessible futures are relevant to the normative status of our actions. But we can and do evaluate merely logically possible worlds too. I can compare a world in which everyone enjoys blissful happiness to another world in which everyone experiences horrendous suffering. Though these worlds are not accessible to anyone, the blissful world is better than the horrendous world. It is also fitting to favour the blissful world. These worlds will not be accessible to anyone, if they contain no agents, only non-agential animals. Still, it is fitting to favour the blissful world. If Roberts admits that these worlds can have value, one wonders whether many of the puzzles will recur in a purely evaluative form, with a connection to fitting attitudes rather than choice.
I also have two comments on the normative implications of Roberts’ account. The first has to do with human extinction. Suppose the future promises a blissful existence for every future human. One already existing person, Grumpy, would be very slightly worse off if humanity continued to exist, and all other existing people would not be affected. If we can now decide between the blissful future for humanity and humans painlessly going extinct, the Pareto reduction principle says we ought to allow humans to go extinct. This is so, since (a) the people who exist in the extinction alternative, the already existing ones, also exist in the non-extinction alternative, (b) non-extinction is worse for one person who exists in the non-extinction alternative, viz. Grumpy, and (c) there is no person in the extinction alternative for whom non-extinction is better than extinction, for the rest of the already existing are unaffected and there are no future humans. So, the principle says that allowing humanity to go extinct is the better alternative and thus required. This is an unwelcome result, and goes against deeply held and widely shared intuitions, something Roberts herself wants to accommodate as far as possible (23).
The second comment concerns Roberts’ ingenious account of stable values. Recall the case with Charlotte, and revise option A by assuming that if and only if A is performed, Charlotte is not created but Charles is created with an unhappy life. Since B will still be assigned value -n, for some n, one might wonder whether A will turn out to be better than B. We need only assume that Charles’ level of unhappiness is -m, where n > m. But surely it is unreasonable to say that an alternative in which someone suffers is better than one in which someone is happy. I suspect that Roberts would say that we need to adjust the negative wellbeing of Charles so that this cannot happen. But how can this be done? Perhaps Roberts will allude to the priority principle she suggests but does not articulate in a different context (162). Choosing A is ‘morally out of bounds’. But it needs to be clarified how this principle will work in connection to the assignment of stable values in a consequentialist framework.
That Roberts’ theory has some unwelcome results is not surprising, since the many impossibility theorems in population ethics show that any theory will have some unwelcome results. There is no pain-free solution to be had. We can only aim to minimize the pain. I am not sure Roberts has succeeded in that, but she has definitely succeeded in giving us a novel approach that must be seriously considered by anyone interested in population ethics.
REFERENCE
Narveson, Jan, 1976. ‘Moral problems of population.’ In Michael D. Bayles (ed.), Ethics and Population, 59–80. Schenkman.