In a 1934 letter to the journal Philosophy, Herbert Samuel, a prominent member of the community, made the following observation about academic philosophy:
Urgent practical questions—of personal and social morality, of economic organization, of international relationship—press upon the peoples, but the leaders of thought give little guidance for their solution.
Fast forward ninety-two years, and we have a book that aims to address Samuel’s challenge.
Against a background in which philosophers tend to be accused of insularity, sometimes justifiably so, Matthew Lindauer’s The Fruitfulness of Normative Concepts offers a vision of moral and political philosophy with the explicit aim to address practical, social problems. The book is motivated by two overlapping questions. First, should moral and political philosophy aim to help answer practical questions, rather than merely clarify values or describe moral phenomena? Second, if normative concepts are meant to play such roles, should our evaluation of competing conceptions of justice, injustice, responsibility, or solidarity make systematic use of empirical research into how people reason and behave? Lindauer answers both questions in the affirmative.
Lindauer’s book is an ambitious and provocative contribution to moral and political philosophy. Its guiding aspiration is to show that normative concepts may be understood as tools whose value partly consists of how well they help us solve the practical problems that arise in collective human life. Lindauer asks us to reconsider what it means for a normative concept to be a good one and what kinds of evidence and methods are relevant to that evaluation.
The central thesis of the book is that moral and political philosophy are more robust enterprises when they take the fruitfulness of normative concepts seriously: roughly, how well those concepts, together with associated norms, principles, and theories, enable us to address the practical problems that we face as social agents. This gap may be filled by thoughtful engagement with empirical work in moral psychology and experimental philosophy. Normative concepts, on Lindauer’s view, play a practical role, and their capacity to do so is an appropriate dimension along which they may be evaluated as concepts.
Lindauer frames his project using a lock-and-key analogy. Practical problems are likened to locks and normative concepts to keys (5). When we face a lock, the most natural response is to ask whether we have a key that opens it. Analogously, when we face persistent moral and political problems, such as poverty, social injustice, or climate change, we should ask whether the normative concepts we deploy are fit for purpose.
Normative concepts, so Lindauer explains, are to be contrasted with descriptive ones, which is instructive. Scientific concepts aim at accurate classification of the natural world and are primarily assessed within expert communities. Normative concepts, by contrast, are embedded in the pragmatic practice of praise and blame, and our practice of assigning moral responsibility. People are typically held morally accountable for upholding unethical moral views and acting wrongly in ways that they are not held accountable for holding false scientific beliefs and spreading misinformation. This difference underwrites Lindauer’s insistence that consensus plays a more central evaluative role in the normative domain than it does in the sciences. “Normative concepts help us to live together with other human beings by aiding us in coordinating our behavior and cooperating with one another” (19). A counter to his approach is Plato’s view, which prominent later works of G.E. Moore, Derek Parfit, G.A. Cohen, David Enoch, and David Estlund align with, where any practical role that moral and political concepts play should be extrinsic to our evaluations of them.
A normative concept is said to be “fruitful”, according to Lindauer, when it helps us solve a practical problem that we have to face in the socio-political realm. He inherits the term “fruitful” from Rudolf Carnap but distances his term from its original estate (§1.5). Lindauer offers five dimensions along which normative concepts may be fruitful. These dimensions apply not just to abstract concepts but to specific norms, principles, or theories that fall under a given concept. Some normative concepts are better than others when it comes to resolving practical problems because they motivate the right kinds of behavior (motivation fruitfulness), prevent the wrong kinds of behavior (prevention fruitfulness), fight against bias (resilience fruitfulness), achieve sufficient consensus despite disagreement (consensus fruitfulness), and guide action so as to behave in ways that support them (guidance fruitfulness).
Lindauer draws on work in experimental philosophy and moral psychology to show that empirical data are not mere handmaidens to armchair reflection but part of the philosophical enterprise itself. This marks an important departure from Carnapian explication where pragmatic virtues are operationalized in ways that remain largely formal and domain-general. Lindauer insists on domain-specificity: normative concepts solve distinctive kinds of practical problems, and the desiderata relevant to evaluating them differ from those applicable to scientific classificatory concepts.
The five dimensions of fruitfulness capture familiar desiderata from moral psychology, but Lindauer’s innovation lies in its treating them as evaluative criteria for normative concepts. Not any one dimension is decisive; instead, together they provide a rich picture of how concepts function in practice. First, motivation gives us insight about how people will act when norms, theories, and principles are internalized. It has recently been shown in some experimental studies that philosophical arguments and concepts of beneficence and justice can intervene in people’s reasoning to motivate them to act in a more charitable way. By contrast, there is also a non-interventionist model whereby we can study the donation behavior of people by drawing inferences from their different modes of moral reasoning (27-30).
Second, a normative concept is said to exemplify preventive fruitfulness when it tells us how people who are made aware of being observed tend to behave better even when the opportunity to steal or cheat is an open possibility. Third, there is resilience fruitfulness to determine whether norms, theories, and principles compete with personal or social biases. When we focus on goal-directed processing, normative concepts sometimes enable people to withstand the urge to follow harmful and highly influential biases. Fourth, consensus fruitfulness has it that some moral and political concepts may be more adept at securing agreement among people even when their moral and political convictions vary. Mikhail’s (2011) exploration of a “universal moral grammar” reveals widespread agreement even among different cultures who seem to possess different normative concepts. Finally, guidance fruitfulness helps us to determine whether a normative concept will help us to formulate more useful prescriptions in guiding actions.
The five dimensions of fruitfulness immediately raises questions about trade-offs. Concepts that score highly on motivation may fare poorly on resilience, and those that foster consensus may do so by amplifying bias. Whereas Lindauer is sensitive to these tensions between the different dimensions of fruitfulness and whereas he insists that fruitfulness is a multidimensional property that admits of conflict and context-dependence, the lack of a decision procedure may give rise to a worry over how to prioritize one criterion over the other. To be fair, at §3.7 Lindauer does show how resilience should take priority over consensus when it serves the goal of solving a practical problem. Future work, either by Lindauer himself or others, may want to address this prioritization question systematically.
Chapter 3 raises ten potential objections. While I do not have the space to go through each of them, I would like to highlight three. The relativism objection holds that if fruitfulness varies with social context, then there can be no universal moral truths. Instead of endorsing moral relativism, Lindauer embraces a modest form of contextualism by suggesting that a solution’s being context-sensitive is a feature, not a bug. Different social problems may indeed require different conceptual resources, and there are also large-scale questions of how people should interact across contexts that are more universal in nature. While this reply defuses the charge of inconsistency, it will not likely satisfy those who support stronger forms of universality.
The concern that Lindauer’s project is overly concessive claims that tying moral requirements to feasibility and motivation risks collapsing morality into whatever people are already willing to do. Lindauer responds by distinguishing between descriptive failures of fruitfulness and normative judgments about which concepts to promote or demote. A concept may be morally compelling yet currently unfruitful; this does not entail that it should be abandoned, only that its unfruitfulness is a relevant fact. This reply leaves open how much weight fruitfulness should carry relative to other evaluative considerations.
Perhaps the most philosophically interesting objection concerns Bernard Williams’ “one thought too many” case (§3.4; see also Williams, 1981,18). Suppose that Sam is faced with the choice of saving one of two people, either Sam’s partner or a stranger. Under such circumstances, Sam may feel a stronger obligation to save their partner. Stopping to reflect on the fruitfulness of the concept of “special obligation” before choosing to save one’s partner would amount to thinking “one thought too many”, despite that it appears Lindauer’s view requires Sam to do so. Using a Rawlsian point, Lindauer wiggles out of this precarious problem by arguing that “the fruitfulness of the concept ‘special obligation’ and the attitudes and actions that it promotes can be examined separately from the possession of these attitudes and the adoption of these actions at a given time” (Lindauer, 92). Lindauer privileges functional success over moral deliberation, which may strike some readers as insufficiently attentive to the fact that personal biases may without justification undermine fruitfulness-based considerations.
The book’s fourth and fifth chapters offer case studies that illustrate how different normative framings can influence behavior. Lindauer endorses an interventionist approach, according to which moral arguments function as deliberate attempts to reshape attitudes, motivations, and practices. This material illustrates what fruitfulness looks like in practice. At the same time, it invites methodological and moral scrutiny. How robust are these behavioral effects? To what extent do they persist over time or generalize beyond controlled settings? And when does intervention lean into manipulation? Lindauer is aware of these concerns, but the discussion would benefit from greater engagement with questions of legitimacy and consent, especially given the increasing use of behavioral insights in public policy.
Lindauer’s book is best read as part of a broader shift in twenty-first-century philosophy away from purely intramural debates and toward greater engagement with practice. Lindauer’s work resonates with recent calls to move beyond the linguistic turn and to rethink the social function of philosophical inquiry. The book neither abandons rigor nor apologizes for relevance. Instead, it challenges philosophers to be clearer about what their concepts are for and to take responsibility for the roles those concepts play in the world.
This challenge extends beyond moral and political philosophy. If Lindauer is correct, then philosophers working on normative concepts in, say, epistemology or metaphysics cannot remain indifferent to how those concepts function in social contexts. This does not mean that every philosophical project must aim at immediate application, but it does mean that claims about normativity carry implicit commitments about guidance and coordination.
Lindauer’s view also has underappreciated implications for moral education. If normative concepts are to be evaluated partly by their fruitfulness, then moral education cannot be confined to the transmission of moral principles or the cultivation of abstract moral reasoning alone. It must instead attend to how moral concepts are internalized, how they interact with bias and ideology, and how they function in practice within social contexts. On this view, teaching about justice or moral responsibility is not merely a matter of articulating their correct content, but of assessing whether normative concepts, as taught and taken up, genuinely contribute to action. Moral education thus becomes a concept-shaping activity whose success depends on fidelity to moral theory, as well as on empirically informed judgments. This both reinforces Lindauer’s interventionist ambitions and sharpens longstanding worries about legitimacy and moral influence.
This conception of the project, however, risks becoming an overly instrumental form of moral education. If the success of moral concepts is assessed primarily by their motivational uptake or social effects, there is a danger of subordinating moral understanding to behavioral efficacy. Such an approach may undervalue the role of moral education in cultivating critical distance from prevailing norms, including the capacity to reject widely shared but unjust conceptual frameworks. Moral education, on this view, ought not merely to shape agents into effective coordinators of existing practices but to equip them with the intellectual resources to question and sometimes resist the very social mechanisms that make certain concepts appear fruitful. From this perspective, the educational aim of fostering reflective moral autonomy may come apart from the kinds of empirical success Lindauer’s fruitfulness criteria are best suited to track.
Lindauer’s book is not without its unresolved tensions. Questions remain about the relative weight of the five dimensions of fruitfulness and the limits of conceptual intervention. Yet these are not reasons to dismiss the project; they are signs of its seriousness. The Fruitfulness of Normative Concepts succeeds in reopening a fundamental question about the aims of moral and political philosophy, and by so doing, it offers both a framework and a provocation.
Samuel’s claim, introduced at the outset, that philosophy is impotent in practical affairs was quickly countered by Robin George Collingwood’s speculation about a new philosophical movement where “philosophy feels itself a collaborator with science, neither its enemy nor its slave, but having its own dignity and its own methods, while it respects those of science” (Collingwood, et al., 1934,264). Readers who, like Samuel, worry that philosophy has become detached from the problems that originally animated it may be reassured by the fact that Lindauer’s compelling response amounts to the kind of new philosophical movement Collingwood prophesied in the 1930s. Normative concepts, on Lindauer’s view, are not merely reflections of our moral intuitions or artifacts of theoretical taste. They are tools for living together. Whether they are good tools is a question we can, and should, try to answer.
ACKNOWLEDGEMENTS
I am grateful to Bob Barnard, Stephanie Gibbons, and Matthew Lindauer for comments on a draft of this review, as well as the Bertrand Russell Research Centre and McMaster University’s Department of Philosophy for providing me with the space and financial support to complete this review.
REFERENCES
Collingwood, R.G., Aldrich, V.C., and Lord Listowel (1934). The Present Need of a Philosophy. Philosophy, 9(35), 262-9.
Mikhail, J. (2011). Elements of Moral Cognition: Rawls’ Linguistic Analogy and the Cognitive Science of Moral and Legal Judgment. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Samuel, H. (1934). The Present Need of a Philosophy. Philosophy, 9(34), 134-5.
Williams, B. (1981). Moral Luck. Oxford: Oxford University Press.