This welcome volume examines Margaret Cavendish and Anne Conway, two mid-17th century British women philosophers who both developed interestingly non-mechanist metaphysical systems. Though Conway’s system is thoroughly theological in a way that Cavendish’s natural philosophy is explicitly not, their systems do share features like the subtitular monism, vitalism, and self-motion at a high level of description, and Marcy Lascano explores the extent to which these correspondences are informative at a more precise level. The volume is important for at least two main reasons. First, it presents what ought to be standard readings on several topics. Second, and I think more importantly, it sets out to do something that no other philosophy monograph has, to my knowledge, tried to do, and that is to let a recently recovered figure set the terms of the debate for understanding other philosophers.
This volume was many years in the works, and in some ways it should be read as a precursor to works that have appeared in the meantime. As an illustration, consider action at a distance. Lascano’s interpretation of Cavendish’s position on this issue stays close to the texts. Cavendish says that “sight and hearing do perceive at a distance” (Cavendish 2001, 184) and regularly repeats such claims (for citations, see 48–49, fn. 5). Lascano therefore attributes to her the view that vision and hearing (and I would add magnetism) involve action at a distance. On David Cunning’s influential account, Cavendish thinks that “all interaction is by contact” (2016, 59). But given what Cavendish wrote, the order of publication here does not reflect the burden of proof.
As another illustration, consider self-knowledge. Cavendish repeatedly says that the organization in nature can only be explained if bodies know how, whither (once: “whether”), and why they move. For Lascano, a body’s self-knowledge thus consists of its knowing “how it is currently figured and moving and how it can move” (5). Lascano thus adds modal elements to what Cavendish says: knowledge of the “how,” “whither,” and “why” of a body’s motion stretches into “how it can move” and (later) “what sort of powers it has” (77). This account of self-knowledge is nevertheless relatively minimal. On Deborah Boyle’s influential (2018) account of self-knowledge, for example, bodies’ self-knowledge includes knowledge of divinely given norms for what they should do. Such norms are part of what Lascano describes as “strong normativity” (19), and it is a good question whether self-knowledge (or some other part of Cavendish’s metaphysics) should really include them. Boyle’s interpretation is defensible—perhaps this normative element is what Cavendish means by “why”—but it is also speculative, and again it makes sense to treat Lascano’s relatively minimal interpretation as a default reading relative to other options in the literature, and require pressure to move in the direction of a more elaborate reading. That is, as the literature continues to develop, proponents of the literature’s more elaborate interpretations should be coming up with passages that Lascano’s readings have difficulty explaining, rather than just explaining how their interpretations treat various passages. All this is to say that Lascano’s monograph presents interpretations of Cavendish that deserve to be treated as standard or default readings. (Had it been written more dogmatically and less responsibly, it might indeed have been the only Cavendish monograph an aspiring instructor would need to read.)
Two features of Lascano’s method bear discussion. First, her approach is more conceptual and philosophical than contextual. To see this, consider another dispute with Boyle, this time over how to understand the complete blending of animate and inanimate matter. Boyle compares the mixture to cake batter (since all ingredients are present in every part of the mixture), while Lascano compares the mixture to “a homogenous mixture of the sort we find in chemistry” (since “each substance retains its own chemical identity”) (13). Those interested in the historical context of Cavendish’s doctrine of complete blending might have put the issue in terms of the mixture’s being per minimas partes and such that the mixture’s ingredients retain their individual natures, substances, or qualities. (In her forthcoming monograph, Alison Peterman suggests some historical context, namely, that Cavendish is influenced by Jan Baptista Van Helmont’s Oriatrike.) But Lascano’s handling of the debate is exactly right, despite the debate being held purely in conceptual rather than historico-contextual terms.
Second, Lascano’s approach is more systematic than developmental. The overall picture of Cavendish presented is generally the mature Cavendish of the mid-to-late-1660s. Lascano is quite good about noting when she is relying especially on one work, but there are some developmental moments in Cavendish’s thinking that go unnoted. For example, Lascano attributes to Cavendish the view that “any portion of matter can be a part of any type of entity that exists” (21–22). But in her earliest works, Cavendish thinks that chunks of “dull matter” (her early name for what she will later call “inanimate matter”) have properties like sponginess or solidity eternally (see Cavendish (1653), “Eternal Matter,” 3). One consequence of these eternal properties is that a bit of spongy brain cannot later become a bit of solid rock (cf. Cavendish (1653), “Of Sense and Reason exercised in their different shapes,” 56f.). Cavendish’s eventual adoption of the view that anything can be reshaped into anything else thus renders inanimate matter something of a vestigial remainder of an earlier theory where bits of inanimate matter had eternal (hence unchangeable) properties of their own, and therefore actually did something other than slow animate matter down. But while this kind of developmental information might help to inform Lascano’s rebuttal of Cunning’s complaint that “It is not clear why [Cavendish] posits inanimate matter” (Cunning (2016), 199, qtd. at 15), it does not really make a difference to her final answer.
Turning to the second and perhaps deeper reason why the volume is important, the structure and title can be misleading. Each chapter takes up Cavendish before taking up Conway, and as other reviewers have noted, the Cavendish half of the book can be read without the Conway half. But the reverse is not quite true, since Lascano does sometimes use her discussion of Cavendish to frame her discussion of Conway. For example, only the Cavendishian setup explains the need to clarify that Conway does not think that motion is a substance before revealing that she holds the very standard view that motion is a mode (64–65), or to say that a transferred motion is “not some additional substance added to body” (66). Although these points about Conway’s metaphysics are so unremarkably Cartesian that it almost seems strange for Lascano to clarify in these ways, it is here that the book’s broader importance for historiography lies. Ongoing processes of revising the canon have too often been processes of merely extending it, leaving the received canon and an associated list of standard questions essentially unchanged, and just adding more figures to the list of those whose answers we should know. Getting new figures taken seriously surely requires relating them somehow to figures that the discipline already takes seriously. But insofar as we just look for answers to preconceived questions, the process can only result in the kind of probable distortion that Quinten Skinner described as a “mythology of doctrines” (1969, 7). A better goal is for the project to change our understanding of works, figures, and issues previously treated as canonical. For, when the project succeeds on those terms, its epistemic payoff will be undeniable. So it is important to at least attempt to introduce the ideas of added figures on their own terms and allow those terms to frame the subsequent debate. Lascano’s is the first philosophy monograph that positions Cavendish in this way.
For the purposes of critical completeness, I have two relatively minor complaints. First, Lascano discusses whether Cavendish is a neutral monist, but not whether Conway is. Since Cavendish is definitely not a neutral monist while Conway plausibly is (see Grey (2017)), the lacuna is puzzling.
Second, Lascano presents her discussion of Cavendish’s theory of causation as aimed in part at answering Eileen O’Neill’s question of what distinguishes Cavendish’s theory from “full occasionalism” (105). Lascano doesn’t define “full occasionalism,” but it is clear that she has Malebranchian occasionalism in mind. This is the view that finite bodies have no causal powers, and that secondary causes are merely apparent causes, which provide the occasions on which God, who has all the real causal power, acts. While Cavendish holds what is normally called an occasional theory of causation about interactions between bodies, she does not deny causal powers to finite bodies generally, so there is no threat of “full occasionalism” (in this sense) here, as Lascano herself notes (107). O’Neill, for her part, attributes to Cavendish a theory that involves both occasional and non-occasional elements: O’Neill claims that Cavendish thinks a hand, in tossing a ball, perfectly (thus “directly and entirely” (2013, 319)) causes motion “on the surface of the ball” and thereby occasions the ball’s further motion (2013, 322). But Lascano does not accept this part of O’Neill’s view. Lascano’s own theory is very plausible, but I’m not sure why “occasionalism” isn’t the right label for it. Lascano notes that, on her theory, “the occasional cause does do something” (116). I agree that it does something, but I think in particular that what it does is occasion something. (Lascano would presumably disagree, but I think she’s using a difference-making criterion that is at least alien to Cavendish’s theorizing if not anachronistic.) To be clear, I have no substantive problem with what Lascano says except insofar as she denies that the right label for Cavendish’s view (of the relevant subset of causal interactions, anyway) is “occasionalism.” There is an established practice in the literature, somewhat downstream of Steven Nadler (1994), of reserving the term “occasionalism” for Malebranchian occasionalism while allowing “occasional theories of causation” to mean something more flexible. I think this established practice is part of the problem here, especially since Lascano’s discussion of causation is at least the third in the secondary literature to be conditioned by an allergy to the term that probably best describes Cavendish’s theory.
There is much more in the volume that I cannot praise for lack of space, but also cannot criticize for lack of objections. Indeed, Lascano addresses many topics in a small number of pages, and intervenes in a large number of ongoing scholarly debates. She seems to me to be right about the monism of both Cavendish and Conway, about how vitalism and self-motion are dealt with in their works, and about Cavendish’s theory of individuals (and especially the two levels of her ontology). Some readers will find fault with her account of Conway’s theory of individuals, since she advances the controversial position that Conway takes individuals to be modes of the one created substance. I myself am not fully convinced by her compatibilist reading of Cavendish on freedom. But I have no more substantive objections to the book than those canvassed above. All of which is to say, it constitutes a most welcome and needed addition to the literature.
REFERENCES
Boyle, D. (2018). The Well-Ordered Universe: The Philosophy of Margaret Cavendish. Oxford University Press, Oxford.
Cavendish, M. (1653). Philosophical Fancies. London.
Cavendish, M. (2001). Observations upon Experimental Philosophy. Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, UK.
Cunning, D. (2016). Cavendish. Arguments of the Philosophers. Routledge, New York.
Grey, J. (2017). Conway’s Ontological Objection to Cartesian Dualism. Philosophers’ Imprint,
17(13):1–19.
Nadler, S. (1994). Descartes and Occasional Causation. British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 2(1):35–54.
O’Neill, E. (2013). Margaret Cavendish, Stoic Antecedent Causes, and Early Modern Occasional
Causes. Revue philosophique de la France et de l’étranger, 138(3):311–326.
Skinner, Q. (1969). Meaning and Understanding in the History of Ideas. History and Theory, 8(1):3–53.