The rationale of Laura D’Olimpio’s manifesto (as she calls it) for the compulsory aesthetic education for all school-aged students at all levels of education is simple and straightforward: “Aesthetic education is necessary due to its distinctive ability to offer, invite and invoke aesthetic experience. Such meaningful experiences, of flow, harmony, beauty, the sublime, shock, awe, wonder, etc., are integral to a flourishing life and, therefore, educators have a responsibility to teach students that they may participate in such experiences” (76).
In advocating for this view, D’Olimpio balances a theoretical approach to the topic of aesthetic education with statistical data (ranging from USA, UK, and Australia) regarding the actual educational practices and policies that underlie students’ engagements with the arts and schools’ organization of art-related programs. The result is a reader-friendly book which does not advance highly abstract and complex theories about the importance of arts, but instead makes its point via clearly presented arguments. Interestingly, D’Olimpio is critical of some of the theories most often advanced in support of the importance of arts (such as their alleged contribution to self-expression or moral development) as well as of some of the key figures of aesthetic education; and her praise of the arts is grounded as much in aesthetic theory as it is in empirical research. While careful not to attribute to the arts any benefits that may seem far fetched or groundless, D’Olimpio presents her arguments from the position of an art-aficionado, taking refuge at times in her own experience with the arts. Ultimately, there is much to applaud in this book and scholars working in the humanities and liberal arts can embrace it as an inspiring approach to the subject.
Unfortunately, it is hard to predict if the book will convert those who do not already appreciate the arts for the power they have to advance our well-being. Nevertheless, D’Olimpio should be congratulated for presenting a convincing account on why that is the case.
In addition to the Introduction and Conclusion, the book comprises seven chapters. D’Olimpio begins by discussing the extensive empirical research into current educational policies, concluding that “the arts are simply not viewed as being as academically rigorous or educationally necessary as other subjects” (17), partly because they are perceived as a “less viable vocational choice for students” (30), particularly within the current consumer capitalist trends which value education only for its market benefits. The main task D’Olimpio sets for herself is this book: countering the perception of the arts as incapable of contributing to the economy of a given country or to the wellbeing (including financial) of an individual’s life. Here, I think, she is quite successful.
In the second chapter, D’Olimpio explains her understanding of the arts, claiming that artworks are the objects intentionally created with the primary function or purpose of producing aesthetic experience, i.e., “experience with aesthetic content” (38). As she claims, three factors are relevant for the proper appreciation of art, all of which require education and training: the skills of the artists, the work itself, and the attitude of the receiver. In this chapter D’Olimpio takes a critical approach to one of the most often-cited reasons for aesthetic education: the so-called expressivist account, according to which arts education helps students learn how to express themselves in different creative ways, a skill not achieved through other academic subjects. But as D’Olimpio points out, not only does this model remain silent on the value of forms of arts that do not include literary expression, but it also wrongly presupposes that all expression is valuable, ignoring those art forms that are more closely related to the exploration of ideas, rather than the expression of emotions. Ultimately D’Olimpio rejects this model as the sole ground of arts’ value, claiming that the defense of aesthetic education should not be grounded in instrumentalist terms. This is also why she rejects the commonly accepted arguments according to which art contributes to our moral education. Not only is it unclear how to choose works which should be introduced into the curriculum on such grounds, but this model hardly recognizes the value that the arts have independently of their alleged contribution to students’ morality. Both of these models fall under the ‘learning through the arts’ paradigm, when the arts are employed for advancement of other purposes. With her account, D’Olimpio develops a different paradigm of education in the arts which is not centered on instrumental benefits but primarily on the value intrinsic to the arts: that of promoting one’s wellbeing via the generation of aesthetic experiences.
To develop her account, D’Olimpio first critically discusses two of the most influential theories on compulsory aesthetic education, namely those defended by Elliot Eisner and by Maxine Greene. For readers unfamiliar with these authors, this chapter gives an extensive overview of the ways in which aesthetic education has been traditionally advanced, and since both authors provide an extensive list of the benefits of aesthetic education (adding up to “composite arguments”, as D’Olimpio refers to them), a reader can get a rather good sense of the many ways in which students’ engagement with arts can be beneficial. And yet, D’Olimpio cautions us to be careful: what she finds problematic in both theories is their failure to show what is distinctively valuable in what the arts offer, where this value is both available in all art forms and unavailable in other subjects on the curriculum. For example, Eisher’s argument, according to which the arts provide unique cognitive value and modes of relating to the world, does not succeed in explaining what this value consists in, while also remaining powerless in showing why the arts are worthy of time and effort if other subjects can deliver such value more efficiently. Meanwhile, the problem with Greene is that she remains unclear and inconsistent in her advancement of the arts, failing to coherently explain the unique aesthetic value of artistic engagements.
For D’Olimpio, this uniqueness is primarily related to the arts’ capacity to provide aesthetic experiences, which play the central role in the flourishing life. As she sees it, humans have a natural instinct for arts and a capacity to experience aesthetic features of the world, but our aesthetic responses are partly learned, partly socially determined and prescribed, which is why we need to be educated in how to approach the arts so that we engage with them in a way that is “open and receptive to what is there to be experienced” (81). Being so educated makes it easier for an individual to achieve eudaimonia. As D’Olimpio argues, since the aim of education is to enable students to lead flourishing lives (and not solely to master potential vocational skills), educators have a responsibility to teach them how to approach art—how to look at it, how to find meaning in it, how to see all that is there to see—so that they get the most out of it. Here D’Olimpio relies on Martha Nussbaum’s capabilities approach, according to which there are ten central human capabilities crucial for a good life, such as life, bodily health and integrity, emotions, practical wisdom, affiliation, and relation to other species and one’s environment. The one most obviously related to the arts concerns our senses, imagination, and thought. Following Nussbaum, D’Olimpio concludes that a flourishing life includes artistic expression and aesthetic experiences “because this is one of the factors which elevates our lives from simple existence and the meeting of our basic needs to having available to us the option of the fully human life; a life that is connected to our culture and creative history” (91).
This line of argument is further supported in chapter five, where D’Olimpio discusses two objections to her theory: the naturalist one, which challenges the need for education in the arts given human’s natural instinct for arts, and the subjectivity objection, which emphasizes individual preferences and choices in leading a flourishing life—if one does not see arts as contributing to one’s wellbeing, why should one be forced to engage with them? In response, D’Olimpio argues that arts education has to be compulsory from the early childhood: not only is this the most efficient means to reinforce, cultivate, and train a natural disposition to enjoy art and achieve aesthetic experiences, but also because otherwise, “there will be students who do not choose to learn more about the arts”, students who fail to realize how rewarding arts can be, which “closes off or at least diminishes the opportunity for them to understand that the arts entail access to aesthetic experiences which enrich one’s life” (106). The benefits of such education are further explored in the final chapter, in a discussion of artworks which present morally problematic or challenging views. D’Olimpio dismisses autonomism in favor of Berys Gaut’s ethicism, claiming that, as educators, we should educate students to engage respectfully, critically, and sympathetically with artworks which may present morally and politically challenging views.
In developing her theory, D’Olimpio insists on the intrinsic value of the arts—the arts afford aesthetic experiences which are a necessary component of a flourishing life. Such a defense, D’Olimpio argues in chapter six, should be preferred over defenses which emphasize the arts’ instrumental values, such as the one developed by Gert Biesta. On Biesta’s view, the arts are beneficial due to their impact on human cognitive development. But if that is the reason to value the arts, claims D’Olimpio, then we can abandon the arts once we find other means to enhance our cognition. She urges us to recognize the intrinsic value of the arts and education, for that is one way in which we can resist a totalizing capitalist system and political economy that supports consumerism. She concludes that while it can be beneficial to point to the favorable consequences of the arts, our defense of aesthetic education should not depend on such arguments. This chapter concludes with an economic survey of the profit value of arts education: contrary to a dominant view, the author shows that a career in the arts promises financial benefits, while also remaining one of the domains least likely to be replaced by technology.
My brief overview of D’Olimpio’s claims hopefully shows why this book is such an important one given the current climate of dismissing the relevance and benefits of the humanities and a liberal arts education. What strikes me as primarily valuable in D’Olimpio’s approach to the benefits of the arts and the necessity of aesthetic education is her capacity to present a clear argument, one which easily resonates even with those who do not have significant philosophical or artistic training. Such simplicity makes it easier for the readers to stay focused on D’Olimpio’s claim regarding the educational system’s responsibility to secure the link between aesthetic education and the good life of its students.
But there is a sense in which such simplicity may also be its flaw: what is lacking in D’Olimpio’s approach is a touch of philosophical caution in the development and deployment of her main concepts, as well as a more practical recipe for how precisely to implement the model of aesthetic education she develops.
For example, D’Olimpio declares herself to be defending “empiricism about aesthetic value and aesthetic experience” (38), but then explains the need for students to be educated on precisely those segments of artistic production that empiricists downplay, such as the historical origins of an artwork. Furthermore, while it is certainly the case that artworks provide aesthetic experiences, it is not so obvious that artworks are designed solely or primarily for that particular purpose—it suffices to point to the very examples D’Olimpio explores in the chapter on ethics to recognize that art, primarily contemporary art, is made with intentions far more diverse than aesthetic. More nuance is needed also in the discussion of aesthetic experience; while D’Olimpio’s account may be one that a reader unfamiliar with philosophical theories on the concept can easily accept, there are other ways in which aesthetic experience can be conceived, some of which do not so easily support D’Olimpio’s claims. For example, some philosophers have wondered if all arts are aesthetic, while others have emphasized the importance of the aesthetic experiences prompted by objects in our immediate surroundings. Downplaying nature as a relevant source of aesthetic experience since “natural beauty is less accessible for schools in urban areas” (99), D’Olimpio sees the arts as our primary source of aesthetic experiences and insists on the claim that one needs to be taught how to engage with the arts so as to have such experiences. But one may wonder if such teaching should indeed be extended for the entire duration of one’s education, particularly if one simply finds more fulfillment in domains not related to the arts and chooses to invest one’s time and efforts in those domains. In the absence of more conclusive evidence supporting the link between aesthetic experience and wellbeing, which one may feel D'Olimpio does not provide, it is questionable if her paternalistic model can do the job she wants it to do in securing one’s flourishing.
D’Olimpio’s account fits nicely with the views, commonly accepted in contemporary aesthetics, on the need for educating people on how to approach art, such as those defended by Dominic Lopez, Bence Nanay and Nick Riggle (2022), or Ted Nannicelli (forthcoming). However, given her ambition of making such education compulsory, there is a sense in which her account is somewhat underdeveloped. Apart from stating the need to educate students on how to approach arts, including “art making, crafting, viewer engagement and critique, history and theory” (99) and insisting on proper education and training for art-teachers, D’Olimpio does not provide more details on how aesthetic education is to be implemented, or who is to decide on the relevant artworks, artists, artistic canons, theoretical approaches, and other elements that this education should include. Arguably, such decisions would depend on some of the criteria that D’Olimpio puts aside in developing her account, such as the cognitive value of art or its capacity to stir moral development. Following D’Olimpio’s model, one may look to include those artworks that have the most capacity to maximize one’s flourishing, but our contemporary theories of wellbeing show that we generally lack agreed-upon criteria as to what makes for a good life. I take this to be all the more relevant given D’Olimpio’s dismissal of an individual’s preferences and subjective wishes: if an individual is not to decide on what is good for her, and there are no objective criteria, how should we select the works that are to help us lead flourishing lives? Consequently, D’Olimpio’s model is vulnerable to the same criticism issued against Nussbaum’s capabilities approach by Alison Jaggar (2006): since it is not clear who is to decide on the relevant items on the capabilities list, it is not clear which artworks are the best fit for the job of enabling us to develop these capabilities. In other words, even assuming that D’Olimpio is right on insisting on the link between aesthetic experience and a flourishing life, and on grounding her paternalistic model on this apparent link, this, in itself, is not enough to help educators organize students’ exposure to aesthetic education. In the era of cancel culture, trigger warnings, and similar such occurrences, it is obvious how pressing—and difficult—this task is.
Notwithstanding these points, I remain convinced that D’Olimipo has presented an important first step in our understanding of the value and necessity of aesthetic education, one which, hopefully, will be inspiring to philosophers, educators, and those working on restoring the humanities to their rightful place in education, the job market, and in society.
ACKNOWLEDGMENT
This work has been supported by the Croatian Science Foundation under the project number UIP-2020-02-1309.
REFERENCES
Jagger, A. (2006), “Reasoning about Well-being: Nussbaum’s Methods of Justifying the Capabilities”, The Journal of Political Philosophy, 14,3,301-322
Lopez, D., B. Nanay and N. Riggle, (2022), The Aesthetic Life and Why It Matters, Oxford University Press
Nannicelli, T. (forthcoming), “Aesthetic Education: A Perceptual-Cognitive Model”, European Journal of Analytic Philosophy