Since Elizabeth Anderson (1999) asked “What Is the Point of Equality?”, political philosophers have contended with the idea that there is something objectionable about standing in relations of inequality with others. For all the work on social equality in the last quarter-century, however, it remains difficult to specify what meaningful social equality (or inequality) is. Moreover, because so much writing about social equality is framed as part of a dispute among egalitarians, who take the value of equality for granted, it remains difficult to specify why social equality (or inequality) matters.
Niko Kolodny’s The Pecking Order makes substantial advances on both fronts. We have, says Kolodny, claims against inferiority—that is, against being subordinate to others in a social hierarchy constituted by asymmetries in power, authority, or regard. Once we understand these claims, he argues, we will see that we already do recognize that inferiority matters. Claims against inferiority are needed to explain a wide variety of core political beliefs. The cost to denying the importance of social inequality would be abandoning many deeply held convictions that we may not think of as especially egalitarian.
This book is essential reading for anyone concerned with the ancient question of whether equality should be a social ideal. The “book-length treatment” (6) of noninferiority and democracy in Parts V and VI is a major work of democratic theory. Those are achievements enough. But because Kolodny’s method requires him to explain how complaints against inferiority are needed to explain a range of “commonplace claims” about politics (2), the book is full of careful, searching, and illuminating argument about many central issues in political philosophy, such as coercion, legitimacy, and state neutrality. The result is extraordinary—all the more because Kolodny is an excellent, engaging stylist, even when the argument is dense. Reviewers should be careful with superlatives, since even the most industrious reader only sees a small portion of excellent work. But I will hazard that The Pecking Order is one of the best and most important works of Anglophone political philosophy of the century so far.
Kolodny’s strategy involves showing that many “commonplace claims” about political morality cannot be vindicated without relying on claims against inferiority. For each commonplace claim, Kolodny argues for a “negative observation” that other argumentative resources cannot justify the claim, and a “positive conjecture” that claims against inferiority can justify the claim (2–3). What are these other argumentative resources? A person can have a claim on another, meaning that other has a reason of “special stringency or priority” to satisfy the claim, and failure to satisfy the claim typically warrants a complaint by the claimholder (13). Many of our claims, says Kolodny, may be categorized as either “claims to improvement” or “claims against invasion.” Claims to improvement are claims on others to improve one’s situation. “Situation improvement” is meant broadly, and could include access to material goods, physical safety, or opportunities to occupy an office (18). Claims against invasion ground rights, understood as constraints on how others may act (28). We have invasion claims against others’ use of our body, and perhaps against some uses of our property.
Kolodny argues that this broad set of claims—improvement and invasion claims—is insufficient to support many “commonplace” ideas about political morality. His core case, treated first and most extensively, is the idea that people subject to a state have a special claim against it, a claim that makes justifying the state a problem, and perhaps triggers a need for legitimating conditions. Improvement claims cannot support a claim against the state per se, since we can imagine an ideal state that satisfies everyone’s improvement claims. Invasion complaints seem more promising, since the state uses or threatens force, and we often have rights against force. On what Kolodny takes to be plausible accounts of natural rights against force, however, most uses and threats of force by an idealized state would be justified defensive measures. (Many activities of the state, moreover, do not essentially involve even threats of force.) So we would have no invasion complaints against an idealized state. Kolodny’s argument here is rich, detailed, and provocative. It includes valuable work distinguishing and assessing different objections to force and to what we often too vaguely call coercion. This part of the book advances our thinking about what is arguably the central problem of modern political philosophy.
Kolodny’s conclusion is not that we should have no concern about an idealized state. The upshot is the positive conjecture: we should have such a concern, and it is explained by claims against inferiority. The state involves some people being “above” the rest of us in a social hierarchy. A hierarchy consists in inequalities of power, authority, and/or “regard,” the greater enjoyment of favorable treatment from others, such as “respect, courtesy, and a willingness to serve interests” (93). The extended analysis of disparities of regard is a significant development of the account of social inequality Kolodny provided in an earlier article (2014b).
Are there not many inequalities of power, authority, or regard that we find unobjectionable, or even valuable? Kolodny agrees that there are. They are unobjectionable when they are sufficiently subject to “tempering factors” that make asymmetries “count less, or not at all, as objectionable relations of inferiority” (98). Such factors include whether the asymmetries are episodic, escapable, or limited in content. One notable factor is what Kolodny calls “Egalitarian Relationship,” that is, whether the people in a relationship involving an asymmetry also “stand as equals . . . in some other recognized relationship” (101). There are also “vertical secondary tempering factors” that mitigate inferiority complaints against the state (and perhaps other types of structured hierarchies, as in firms). One of the most interesting of these is “Least Discretion,” that officials occupying offices exercise no more discretion than serves the reasons justifying the offices (125). This seemingly anodyne requirement is critical to Kolodny’s argument that institutions like the state or firm can avoid objectionable hierarchy, and the requirement has real egalitarian bite, for instance in grounding arguments against corruption. Of special interest to democratic theorists is “Equal Influence,” that “those subject to what would otherwise be superior power and authority have equal opportunity to influence it” (125).
Kolodny’s account of claims of inferiority is the most systematic answer yet to the first post-Anderson question of just what social (in)equality is. It recognizes the plurality of egalitarian concerns, while providing an organizing structure to explain how these different concerns are unified. Kolodny’s analysis is a significant development of T.M. Scanlon’s (1996, 2018) influential idea that there is a “diversity of objections to inequality.” There will be debates about whether the analysis, which includes so many different types of inferiority, sufficiently unifies these diverse objections. I believe the plurality of egalitarian concerns is no theoretical vice, but others may hope for more streamlining.
Kolodny uses this analysis of inferiority to defend his negative observations and positive conjectures about a range of other commonplace claims, for instance, about equality of liberty, discrimination, and illiberal state interventions. His discussions of these topics are rewarding in themselves. The answer to the second post-Anderson question of why social inequality matters is provided not so much by directly explaining what is so bad about inequality, as by establishing that we do already care deeply about inequality, in the form of the commonplace claims. We just have not understood that what we care about is the rejection of hierarchy.
Kolodny addresses some other “grand theories” of what makes certain kinds of inequality objectionable. He develops a serious challenge to theorists of non-domination. Kolodny argues that our anxieties about being under the power of other wills are better captured by complaints against subordination than by complaints against others having the capacity to interfere with our choices. The latter complaint, moreover, may be impossible to assuage, as others—perhaps individually, and certainly severally—inevitably have such power. Neo-republicans are aware of this challenge (Lovett and Pettit 2019), but it is an important one, and should have wide ramifications in the field, given the immense influence of neo-republican thought.
Kolodny also contrasts his view with those emphasizing “relations of equality.” This might surprise, since Kolodny is writing squarely in the social or relational egalitarian tradition. But he denies that “asymmetries or disparities matter only insofar as they are implicated in a failure to realize some specific good: namely, a relationship of a kind whose value depends on its being egalitarian” (270). We may have claims against inferiority with others even when there are no such relations “in the offing” with them—for instance, because we will never be (egalitarian) friends with them (271). This suggests, says Kolodny, that there is an independent objection to hierarchy, and that objections to hierarchy are conceptually and normatively prior to any claims to enjoy egalitarian relations.
Most relational egalitarians would acknowledge there are objections to hierarchy or inequality that do not depend on the positive value of equality, or the prospect of establishing equal relations. This does not imply, in my view, that there are no significant claims to such relations. Egalitarian relationships matter, in part, because the constituents of the relationship—equal regard, courtesy, concern, and so on—assure others that we will not try to subordinate them. Because we are vulnerable to others, such assurance and the trust it builds is essential to relating well with others. Because we are temporal beings, it is important that our interactions with others are conducted so we may enjoy confidence based on past behavior and in expectation of future security—that is, that we enjoy ongoing relations of a certain character with them. This suggests to me that we may indeed have claims to relations of civic friendship, and civic equality, even where no more intimate relationship is available (or desirable).
Kolodny recognizes many reasons to value equal relations. It is important to manifest to others the dispositions not to “endorse” any asymmetric power or authority we enjoy, dispositions which Kolodny, rightly in my view, emphasizes as essential to determining whether objectionable hierarchy is present (93–94). We need equal relations to temper inevitable inequalities of power and authority (and maybe regard) that arise from human diversity and the division of labor. (Hence the tempering factor “Egalitarian Relationship.”) We need “Popular Control” (on which more shortly) to temper the asymmetrical power of political authorities. Popular Control in turn requires a relationship of equal citizenship in part constituted by positive, equal influence over officials (332). Kolodny sees these claims to equal relations as derivative and defensive—as ways to avoid or temper the real concern, objectionable hierarchy. My own point about the importance of relations in providing mutual assurance grants some conceptual priority to hierarchy. (We need to be assured about something!) But conceptual priority is not normative priority, much less exclusive normative significance. If the need for defense is fundamental to our nature as vulnerable, social creatures, and defense requires the affirmative building of relations of a certain quality, we may miss something if our account of equality fails to incorporate entitlements to those positive relationships. The value of equal relational standing constituted by security from various dimensions of inferiority may provide justificatory force to what otherwise might seem like trivial complaints about unequal regard (or even power). That value would also likely have implications for the justification of democracy, if the sharing of power and authority is an important constituent of equal relations.
Kolodny is hardly inattentive to the relationship between equality and democracy. The book provides impressive contributions to many problems in democratic theory, from the implications of Arrow’s Impossibility Theorem to explaining the wrong of partisan gerrymandering. Most important is Kolodny’s argument for democracy. Kolodny’s view of inferiority implies that democracy is required to avoid asymmetries of power and authority, and as a key factor tempering the inequalities involved in rule by a state. The same claims against inferiority that explain our firmly held convictions also hold against oligarchic or authoritarian forms of government. This is a powerful argument, though vulnerable, as Kolodny says (181), to an argument that other factors short of democracy—such as providing equal consideration or treatment to citizens—might be sufficient to temper otherwise objectionable state hierarchies.
A difficult challenge for any egalitarian defense of democracy is to justify representation, or, more precisely, political office-holding. Office holders inevitably have more power, and probably more authority and regard, than ordinary citizens. Kolodny responds by arguing that if an individual is subordinate to a body (call it an “intermediate body”), and that body is in turn subordinate to another body (call it a “higher body”), the individual is subordinate to the higher body (330–31). But if we have equal influence over the higher body, we are not subordinate to it—or, more precisely, to the people who make it up. And if the higher body controls the intermediate body, we are not subordinate to the people who make up the intermediate body, either. Thus, says Kolodny, equality requires that there be an abstract body, the People, which is subject to the equal influence of each citizen, and which sufficiently controls the state’s highest officers (who in turn control the lower officers). Political equality therefore requires equality of opportunity for formal influence (such as voting), equality of opportunity for informal influence (such as persuasion), and popular control of the highest offices.
The requirement of popular control is a new, important development in Kolodny’s thought. What does it mean for the People to control officers, such as legislators or executives? Kolodny says the People must have “occupancy control,” i.e., the ability to determine who holds office; “regulative control,” i.e., the ability to constrain or overrule the decisions of officers, and “directive control,” i.e., the ability to issue directives to officers that officers in fact follow (331). How much of each kind of control is required to render a state non-hierarchical is fuzzy, perhaps inevitably so. These seem like demanding requirements—they seem to me to require what Michael Zuckert (2003:155–59) called the “short-leash republicanism” of many American Anti-federalists, such as short terms of office (see 382), large assemblies, and strong norms that officers should follow constituent mandates. This is no objection, but it suggests that the requirement of popular control substantially narrows the range of acceptable “formal equal influence” electoral systems, in contrast to what Kolodny describes as the formal permissiveness of his position (354). This aspect of popular control may also be in tension with Kolodny’s defense of relatively independent “bankers and judges” (336) and of super-majority rules (358), as these institutions arguably limit the directive control of voters.
Kolodny believes that citizens can exercise directive control over officers if candidates campaign on clear platforms. Electoral victory can be interpreted as a directive to enact the platform. The People must maintain ongoing directive control, so they must have frequent opportunity to vote on platforms. But directive control does not, says Kolodny, require further popular control of officers between elections. Does this permission to more or less ignore constituents introduce a troubling hierarchy? Matters are complicated, as the need to enable directive control in the next election might place constraints on behavior and deliberation while holding office. But would Kolodnian citizens be, as Rousseau said of the English, only free (or here, equal) at election time, and slaves (or at least, subordinates) otherwise? Kolodny has a powerful, novel argument against the idea of equal popular power or authority between elections, grounded in the absence of any actual procedure (apart from the election) to determine what a fair or equal way of responding to citizen preferences or judgments or demands would be. I am not sure that things are always quite so indeterminate, for all the power of Arrow’s Theorem. We might hope for criteria of egalitarian representation—of granting citizens equal authority in an ongoing way—that at least narrow the range of acceptably democratic options for officers to pursue.
The requirement of popular control might be in tension with the requirement of equal opportunity for influence. When arguing that we have egalitarian reason to obey democratic laws, Kolodny emphasizes that equality of influence over decisions addresses not influence over what is written in law, but is “influence over what is actually done” (328). Equal (opportunity for) influence over what is actually done is different from equal (opportunity for) influence over a People that controls officers who make and enforce laws that lead citizens to actually do things. This more complicated structure may suggest a different idea of equal, democratic deliberation. Directive control over officials—and equality with each other—may require ongoing citizen authority in deliberation, which includes the formal and informal agenda-setting that ultimately issues in platforms. How that authority could be equal is a difficult question, but it might not be properly secured by equality of influence, whether over elections or over what is actually done. Equality of influence over those final outcomes may not be equivalent to equality throughout the People’s process of exercising democratic control.
I wish I could go on; others certainly will. There is so much to say about The Pecking Order because it says so much and so well. It will be subject to countless questions and challenges, because it treats such a range of subjects with such care and such innovation. We will be arguing about it, and thereby honoring it, for a long time.
REFERENCES
Anderson, Elizabeth. 1999. “What Is the Point of Equality?” Ethics 109 (2): 287–337.
Kolodny, Niko. 2014b. “Rule Over None II: Social Equality and the Justification of Democracy.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 42 (4): 287–336.
Kolodny, Niko. 2019. “Being Under the Power of Others.” In Elazar and Rousseliere, eds., Republicanism and the Future of Democracy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 94–114.
Lovett, Frank and Philip Pettit. 2019. “Preserving Republican Freedom: A Reply to Simpson.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 46 (4): 363–83.
Scanlon, T.M. 1997. The Diversity of Objections to Inequality. The Lindley Lecture. Lawrence: Department of Philosophy, University of Kansas.
Scanlon, T.M. 2018. Why Does Inequality Matter? Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Zuckert, Michael P. 2003. “The Political Science of James Madison.” In History of American Political Thought, ed. Bryan-Paul Frost and Jeffrey Sikkenga, 149–66. Landam, MD: Lexington.