For over 4 decades, Elliott Sober has been examining and illuminating philosophical aspects of evolutionary theory. His recent book, The Philosophy of Evolutionary Theory, is something of a culmination of his extensive contributions to philosophers’ and biologists’ thinking about evolution. In this review, my aim is not so much to engage positions and lines of argument Sober introduces in the book, since the vast majority of that material has seen philosophical scrutiny already; rather, my aim is to (1) give readers a good sense of what to expect from the text and (2) offer some suggestions about how the book might be used and by whom.
In the Acknowledgements section in the introductory parts of the book, Sober offers a brief account of its origins. He notes that it began as a successor to his 1993 Philosophy of Biology text but then realized that what he was writing was an entirely new book. I think this introductory note is worth mentioning here, since it serves as testament to two important elements of the book. First, like Philosophy of Biology, this book presents very much in the style of a philosophical textbook, exemplified by the frequent footnotes with questions ripe for discussion as well as short exercises. Second, and again paralleling the 1993 text, the contents are shaped around Sober’s own interests, thinking, and contributions to the various topics.
The contents of the text are organized in a clever fashion, reflective of the book’s subtitle: concepts, inferences, and probabilities. Most of the nine chapters are organized around a key concept or closely related concepts, within or regarding evolutionary theory. The chapters then begin with a sketch of Charles Darwin’s thinking on the respective chapter’s material focus. This sets the stage for Sober to pursue various questions and develop lines of argument. Probabilistic terms and tools are used to both frame the questions and support Sober’s position on the philosophical topics introduced. Chapter 2 (Fitness and Natural Selection), Chapter 3 (Units of Selection), Chapter 4 (Common Ancestry), Chapter 5 (Drift), Chapter 6 (Mutation), Chapter 7 (Taxa and Genealogy), and Chapter 8 (Adaptationism) all generally follow this structure. The exceptions are Chapter 1 (A Darwinian Introduction) and Chapter 9 (Big-Picture Questions). Chapter 1 offers the essentials of evolution, with emphasis on Darwin’s own conception of the theory. Chapter 9 is something of a grab bag. Below I’ll engage one element from the grab-bag to illustrate another important feature of the book.
As signaled above, probability occupies a foundational role in both the set-up of philosophical questions and the arguments Sober offers in defense of his views on these questions. In fact, it is nearly impossible to overstate the importance probability plays in the book. Readers with previous exposure to Sober’s work as well those who are well versed in formal aspects of confirmation theory in the philosophy of science, will find familiar the probabilistic concepts and tools utilized. The details of these concepts and tools extend beyond the scope of a review of this type, but it is worth mentioning that Sober is critical of traditional frequentism, particularly its reliance on significance tests (as discussed in Chapter 5 on Drift). He also distances himself from Bayesian style probability arguments. Instead, Sober routinely deploys the law of likelihood and the Akaike Information Criterion to develop his probabilistic arguments.
This last point about the various probabilistic elements peppered throughout the text raises interesting meta-questions about the book, namely: who might benefit from it, and how might readers use it? The two groups mentioned above—those with previous exposure to Sober’s work and those well-versed in confirmation theory—are prime candidates.
For the former group, I suspect there are two main benefits the book may provide. The first is simply that it offers a condensed source for nearly all of Sober’s thinking on evolutionary theory, material that spans multiple books that include The Nature of Selection, The Philosophy of Biology, Unto Others, and Evidence and Evolution. Unless, then, one has read effectively everything Sober has written, there will be something new to take away from this text.
But even those intimately familiar with Sober’s corpus will likely find the textbook character of the book useful for exactly that purpose. Graduate seminars on evolution in both philosophy and biology would be well-served by making this book a central focus. And even undergraduate philosophy of biology courses could benefit from select chapters, depending on the interests of the instructor and the background knowledge of the students in the course.
Readers coming from general philosophy of science and those interested in confirmation theory should also find the text worth engaging. As emphasized above, the text is rich with distinct targets within evolutionary theory that consider and utilize various probabilistic concepts and tools. Any general philosopher of science who focuses on or is broadly interested in formal confirmation theory would gain much from the ways Sober utilizes probability to defend positions on matters related to evolution.
A natural question arises from the above identification of those two groups that are prime candidates likely to benefit from the book, and that is whether there are potential readers outside of those groups. The answer to that question, I’d suggest, is yes. Sober has written the book in such a way as to be accessible and have a broad appeal. In many of Sober’s discussions about different aspects of probability, for example, he uses simple illustrations of coin tossing to assist readers with their understanding of the point he’s making. And spread throughout the text are short discussions of classic (i.e., introductory) issues in the philosophy of science.
These elements suggest Sober wants to widen the readership beyond the obvious candidates, and in that, I think he succeeds. Professional biologists and advanced students in biology willing to reflect on fundamental questions about evolution should find the book of value. Philosophers, too, from outside of philosophy of biology and philosophy of science can learn a great deal about both these areas and may find interesting connections with their own specialty. Ethicists might, for instance, find the pointed discussion of altruism in Chapter 3 valuable. To be sure, many of these readers may find the consistent use of formal mathematics in the text intimidating. But in most instances, the thrust of both the question and Sober’s argument can be grasped without following the details of the formal steps of the mathematical argument.
There is one other feature of the text worth mentioning that is particularly relevant to potential readers not familiar with the philosophy of biology. As one would expect with a book from a defining figure like Sober, the contents of the text reflect his own interests and contributions to the philosophy of evolutionary theory. But it should be no surprise that philosophical issues regarding evolutionary theory extend beyond what Sober discusses. In some instances, his discussion is narrowly focused, but readers can get a view of the wider philosophical issue. The case of essentialism in Chapter 7, I think, is an example of this. In other instances, however, uninitiated readers will be blind to wider philosophical issue(s) that come with the topic discussed. Chapter 9 provides a vivid example.
Among the set of topics Sober considers in Chapter 9 is the question of whether there are laws of evolution. Sober’s answer to that question is yes, and he proceeds to outline what he contends is an a priori law of evolution. As part of this discussion, Sober provides the necessary philosophical background on the issue of laws of nature: that they are necessarily true generalizations. It is the mathematical character of the generalization he details that ensures the necessity requirement is satisfied, but the non-empirical nature of this true generalization is also what attracts philosophical scrutiny, as Sober concedes. This discussion is certainly sufficient to gain some exposure to the question of laws of evolution generally; however, there is a much more expansive philosophical issue regarding the relation between evolutionary theory and laws of nature, one which those new to the philosophy of evolutionary theory would miss in limiting themselves to this discussion.
One of the most fundamental philosophical issues that can be posed about evolutionary theory concerns its status as scientific theory. That is, we can ask what the essential structure of scientific theories is, and in turn, examine how evolutionary theory manifests (or perhaps fails to manifest) that underlying structure. According to the syntactic view of theories, the underlying structure is rooted in logic and set theory, such that, for example, any mathematical expression of a theory is expressible in the uninterpreted terms of predicate logic and sets.
The syntactic view purports to have various virtues, including a fundamental unification of science. Moreover, laws of nature are an important element in the syntactic view. For—just as Sober outlines—laws are necessarily true generalizations, and those sentences can be expressed in terms of first order logic. If, for example, “all life proteins are left-handed” is a law of nature (and notice there is reason to be skeptical of that claim), that law can be expressed in uninterpreted fashion as (∀x)(Px⊃Lx). The ability to formulate the entirety of a theory in formal metamathematical terms such as universal generalizations is the presumption of the syntactic view of theories.
This brief sketch of the syntactic view of theories situates the question of laws of evolution in a much broader philosophical context than the narrow discussion Sober offers. And there is much more to say about the question of how laws of nature bear on the issue of the structure of evolutionary theory, especially with respect to structuring it in the absence of laws. At this point, it’s obvious that the philosophical focus has drifted far from Sober’s interest in the question regarding laws of evolution; but that is the point in sketching this broader philosophical context.
Philosophy of Evolutionary Theory clearly will be successful in introducing readers to philosophical issues surrounding evolution. But as expansive as the range of topics Sober discusses is, readers would do well to keep in mind that, in a few instances, his discussions should be seen more as departure points for wider philosophical investigation. As a point of emphasis, this isn’t a criticism of the book; no textbook is truly comprehensive in its coverage of material. And it is appropriate and expected that the boundaries of Sober’s text are set by his own vast contributions to the field. The point here is simply to encourage readers new to the philosophy of evolutionary theory, as well as those readers with limited understanding of the issues, to keep in mind the value of exploring beyond the text.
Philosophy of Evolutionary Theory is a welcome new textbook that promises to be an exceptional resource for those wanting to learn about philosophical issues focused on evolution. The text will be equally valuable to those who teach philosophy of biology classes with an emphasis on aspects of evolution. The formal aspects will certainly challenge some readers, but the benefits of this efficient (at just 257 pages) guide to thinking about evolution can be gained by almost any reader who has an interest in investigating a range of philosophical issues that evolutionary theory presents.