Reasons play many different roles across different domains. There are reasons for action. And there are reasons for belief. Some reasons merely justify. Others also demand. At a given time, some but not all of the reasons are possessed by or can guide a particular agent. In The Range of Reasons: in Ethics and Epistemology, Daniel Whiting develops a novel modal theory of reasons that unifies the different roles that reasons play across the practical and epistemic domains. This well-argued book will be of interest not only to philosophers who work on reasons but also to those who work on ethics and epistemology.
Before we get to the modal theory in Chapter 4, there are 3 chapters of preliminary material. Chapter 1 provides an overview of the book. In Chapter 2, we start with reasons for action and are presented with the many roles and relations that practical reasons can have and that any proper theory of practical reasons should be able to account for. And for illustration, Whiting develops a provisional evidence-based account of practical reasons. In Chapter 3, Whiting presents an initial case for the distinction between justifying and demanding reasons, which plays a central role in his modal theory, by showing how it helps explain the differences between the overall statuses of ought, may, and must. And again, to illustrate the distinction, the provisional evidence-based account is developed: a fact is a justifying reason for you to act if and only if the fact is evidence that, in acting, there is a respect in which acting is right; and a fact is a demanding reason for you to act if and only if the fact is evidence that, in acting, there is a respect in which acting is wrong. A lot of time is spent on developing this account, including addressing objections, and one may question whether that time is properly spent. But this account provides a sharp contrast that helps highlight features of the modal theory, and the modal theory could be seen as a natural evolution of the provisional account. Thus, despite the wait, the eventual payoff, I think, is worth it.
In Chapter 4, Whiting presents a case for rejecting the provisional evidence-based account and accepting a novel modal theory, which is similar in structure to the provisional account, except that instead of referring to evidence it refers to right-makers. (In the practical domain, Whiting remains neutral about what features are right-makers.) Consider Whiting’s example, LOTTO:
Suppose that one respect in which it is right to act is that it does not harm anyone. Of course, one might reject this, but what matters is the structure of the case, not the substance. Now suppose that there is a lottery in which there are 1,000 tickets. The lottery is fair, and one ticket is drawn at random. Lily is offered 999 tickets at no cost. Her only options are to play or not to play. If one of Lily’s ticket is drawn, nothing happens. If the remaining ticket is drawn, number 1,000, someone is harmed. (61)
Her evidence shows that playing very likely results in no harm and so is in a respect right. So, given the provisional evidence-based account, there is a strong justifying reason to play. And her evidence shows that playing is very unlikely to result in harm and so is in a respect wrong. Assuming the weight of a reason is a function of the significance of the right-or-wrong-maker as well as the likelihood of the right-or-wrong-maker obtaining, Whiting concludes that, according to the provisional account, LOTTO is a justifying reason for Lily to play. But Whiting rightly suggests that LOTTO is not a justifying reason for Lily to play. To support this, Whiting draws on a plausible principle about moral worth:
WORTH: Necessarily, a person is praiseworthy in a respect for acting if and only if they act for a reason and do so because it is a reason for them to act. (62)
Suppose Lily plays because it very likely results in no harm. She does not seem praiseworthy (it even seems blameworthy). So, given WORTH, LOTTO cannot be a justifying reason to play. The provisional account thereby yields the wrong verdict in such kinds of lottery cases.
As an alternative, Whiting proposes a modal theory of objective reasons for action:
MODALJR: Necessarily, a fact, F, is a justifying reason for a person to act if and only if:
(i) R is a respect in which it is right for them to act;
(ii) in every nearby metaphysically possible world in which F obtains, R obtains. (64)
and
MODALDR: Necessarily, a fact, F, is a demanding reason for a person to act if and only if:
(i) W is a respect in which it is wrong for them not to act;
(ii) in some nearby metaphysically possible world in which F obtains, W obtains. (67)
Unlike the evidence-based account, the modal theory gets the right verdict on LOTTO because it appeals not to the probabilities given the evidence but to nearby metaphysical possibilities.
In short, there is a justifying reason to act when it is hard not to be (in one respect) right, and there is a demanding reason to act when it is easy to be (in one respect) wrong. So, on one hand, LOTTO is not a justifying reason to play because, in a nearby world in which LOTTO holds, 1,000 is drawn, and someone is harmed; and so there is no respect in which it is right to play. In other words, there is no justifying reason to play as it is easy not to be (in one respect) right. On the other, there is a demanding reason not to play as it is easy to be (in one respect) wrong. LOTTO is a demanding reason to not play because, in a nearby world in which LOTTO holds,
1,000 is drawn, and someone is harmed; and so there is a respect in which it is wrong to play.
MODALJR and MODALDR thereby yield the correct verdict in such kinds of lottery cases.
In Chapters 5–6, Whiting extends the core idea of the modal theory to possessed reasons and subjective reasons, respectively. First, a fact can be an objective but not a possessed reason. because if no agent is in a position to act on it, no agent possesses that reason. Suppose that there is a fire burning in the basement. That may be an objective reason to put out the fire, but unless you know that there is a fire and can respond to that, you do not possess that reason. To capture the idea that a fact is a possessed objective reason only if you can be guided by it, Whiting adds to MODALJR and MODALDR a condition that you can respond to that reason and a condition on nearby epistemologically possible worlds that mirrors (ii), respectively. The rough idea is that an objective reason is possessed only if there is an alignment between the relevant nearby epistemic possibilities and the relevant nearby metaphysical possibilities. Second, a fact can be a (possessed) objective reason without being a subjective reason because it seems that some fact can be an objective reason (and even be in a position for you to act on), but it still cannot rationalize your action. To capture the idea of rationality, Whiting starts with the conditions for possessed objective reasons (justifying and demanding, respectively) and subtracts from them (ii), that is, the condition on nearby metaphysically possible worlds. The rough idea is that, for rationality, only your relevant nearby epistemic possibilities matter.
In Chapters 7–9, Whiting extends the modal theory from the domain of action to that of belief. The basic approach is to take the same conditions for the three types of practical reasons and change the range from actions to beliefs. Also, in the domain of belief, Whiting suggests that truth is the sole respect in which a belief is right. Chapters 7–9 basically mirror Chapters 4–6. Of course, the substantive norms and cases considered differ because the right-makers differ. And as Whiting rightly suggests, a reader could consider an alternative reading order: read each respective pair of chapters on reasons for action and for belief one after the other (that is, 4, 7, 5, 8, 6, and 9). Or alternatively, one may, as I did, read it in order the first time but read the respective pairs together the second time.
This review passes over quite a lot, especially the last third that focuses on epistemic reasons, but I must leave room for a worry I have with the modal theory of practical reasons. Whiting allows that a fact can be both a reason to do a deed and a reason not to do that deed because that deed may be “in one way right but in another way wrong” (62). For instance, “That Miyuki’s favourite film is showing might be a reason for Miyuki to go to the cinema, since it would benefit her, and a reason for her not to go, since she promised not to watch it” (62). Now, a fact, it seems, can be a good reason to do a deed and a bad reason to do it, too. Suppose Miyuki’s friend has been practicing baking to prepare for a baking competition, and one day, her friend asks her to try some homemade croissants and to give her honest opinion. Miyuki thinks that they are too buttery and not so tasty. This is the fact of the matter. Now, Miyuki has a good reason to give her honest opinion, I think, because it is in a respect right (perhaps, telling the truth is a respect that it is right). But Miyuki may have a bad reason, too. Giving her honest opinion is in a respect wrong, I think, because it hurts her friend’s feelings. And Miyuki may give her honest opinion precisely (and solely) to hurt her friend’s feelings, say, because she holds a grudge over an old fight (assuming that her friend is pained by the criticism). But even if she has a grudge, she may act from either the good reason or the bad reason. And drawing on a more precise version of WORTH, acting from the good reason is praiseworthy, but acting from the bad one is blameworthy (e.g., Arpaly 2002; Arpaly and Schroeder 2013). And even when she acts on the fact in the blameworthy way, she is still acting from a reason. In this case, she is blameworthy precisely because she does act from a bad reason rather than simply failing to act either on a good reason or on the best reason or set of reasons. So it seems that a fact can be both a good reason and a bad reason for the very same action.
Now, assume that giving the honest opinion is overall the right thing to do. (Even if it is not, an analysis with the same structure can be given.) Given the modal theory, the fact that Miyuki has an opinion about her friend’s croissants is an objective overall reason to give it because the theory mainly focuses on whether it is hard not to be right or easy to be wrong. But there seems to be a distinction between objectively good and bad reasons for action. Given the same facts, an agent can perform either a praiseworthy or a blameworthy action. Thus I wonder whether the theory could be modified to account for this important distinction.
Despite some reservations with the account, the modal theory as a whole is quite impressive. The way it is naturally and elegantly extended from one notion of reason to another and then again from the practical to the epistemic is a stunning feat. So even if counter-examples exist, competing theories will need to reckon with the comprehensive unity of the modal theory. And the modal theory could even gain in explanatory power if as suggested in the last chapter it could be extended to yet other domains such as the domain of emotion.
ACKNOWLEDGMENT
I wish to thank Troy Seagraves for many valuable discussions about the book.
REFERENCES
Arpaly, Nomy (2002) Unprincipled Virtue: An Inquiry Into Moral Agency (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Arpaly, Nomy and Timothy Schroeder (2013) In Praise of Desire (Oxford: Oxford University Press).