Chase Wrenn’s book is dedicated to describing and resolving a certain puzzle about true beliefs. On the one hand, we ordinarily think true beliefs are valuable: as individuals and communities we seek them; we let our tax dollars fund research to produce and promote new ones; and we criticize others (especially public figures) who lie and show indifference to what we all know to be true. On the other hand, we ordinarily think the truth of our beliefs is pretty simple: it’s a matter of corresponding to facts or—more simply, just believing things are as they are. What’s supposed to be puzzling here is that our ordinary thinking about what truth is—what it consists of—doesn’t say anything about it being valuable or otherwise normative. So how is it that true beliefs are valuable if the nature of truth is not normative? The challenge here is to come up with an overall theory of truth that is both a good theory of truth’s nature and a good theory of truth’s value (1–2).
To frame his discussion, Wrenn distinguishes between two theories of the nature of truth and two theories of the value of truth. The two theories of the nature of truth are Aristotelian theories and Normativist theories. According to Aristotelian theories, “truth is a matter of saying things are as they are” (2). An important sub-group of Aristotelian theories are deflationary theories on which truth is not a substantive property (7, 37, 85). By contrast, on Normativist theories of truth, truth “is properly explained in normative or evaluative terms” (3). The two theories of the value of truth are the Value-Conferral Theory and the State-Given Theory. On the Value-Conferral Theory, a proposition being true confers or makes believing that proposition valuable (10, 17, 90, 113). On the State-Given Theory, a true belief is valuable because desiring true beliefs is part of a character trait that is a moral virtue (10–11, 39–40, 109, 168).
Wrenn’s solution involves the following combination: an Aristotelian, specifically deflationist, theory of the nature of truth with a State-Given Theory of the value of truth. Wrenn sees this combination of views as natural. As he puts it, if truth isn’t a substantive property, how could it confer value on things (10, 37, 111)? In this way, he thinks, a supporter of a deflationist theory of the nature of truth is naturally driven to a State-Given Theory of the value of truth.
After introducing the puzzle in chapter 1, Wrenn defends his preferred State-Given Theory of the value of truth in chapters 2–3; in chapter 4 he criticizes Normativist theories of truth; and in chapters 5–8 he criticizes Value-Conferral Theories of the value of truth.
In chapter 2, Wrenn develops his own version of the State-Given Theory of the value of truth. Wrenn adopts a broadly consequentialist account of moral virtue, on which a character trait is a moral virtue if it promotes more overall good than a contrasting trait (20–1). He compares a character trait of “Truthfulness” that involves valuing or caring about truth (20) with a character trait of “Untruthfulness” that involves not valuing truth sufficiently, either for ourselves or others (26). Wrenn gives an extended argument that Truthfulness promotes the overall good more than Untruthfulness due to a variety of factors: contributing to intellectual integrity, promoting trustworthiness in a society, promoting epistemic justice, mitigating polarization, etc. (27–36). Thus, Truthfulness is a moral virtue.
We ought to be morally virtuous. And Truthfulness is a moral virtue. Therefore, we ought to be Truthful. But part of being Truthful involves valuing true beliefs. Therefore, Wrenn claims, true beliefs are valuable. For the state of valuing true beliefs is part of a character trait that is a moral virtue that promotes the overall good (38–40). Thus, the reason why true beliefs are valuable is because it ought to be the case that we are in a state that values true beliefs.
In chapter 3, Wrenn describes the truth-oriented desires that are part of being Truthful. He draws a sequence of helpful distinctions between the strength of these desires (how much you would give up for true beliefs), their breadth (which subject matters you are interested in), and their scope (which people have the true beliefs). He ultimately argues that the desires are generic desires that allow for flexibility and exceptions (46–51). In the final more technical section of the chapter (51–68), Wrenn explains how a generic desire for true beliefs is consistent with deflationism, while criticizing a rival account of valuing truth due to Paul Horwich.
In chapter 4, Wrenn criticizes Normativist theories of the nature of truth. His central criticism involves two kinds of propositions: “blindspots,” which are propositions that could be true, but couldn’t be truly believed and “brightspots,” which are propositions that could be false, but couldn’t be falsely believed. To use his examples, a “blindspot” proposition is: “It’s raining, and no one believes it’s raining,” and a “brightspot” proposition is: “seven is a prime number, and someone believes seven is prime.”
The basic argument goes as follows (77–78): If Normativist theories of the nature of truth are correct, then if a proposition is true, it would be valuable to believe it. Blindspot propositions are true. Therefore, it would be valuable to believe them. But if one were to believe them, they would be false and thus not valuable to believe. Therefore, there are some true propositions that would not be valuable to believe, so Normativist theories of the nature of truth are incorrect. It is not part of the nature of truth that true propositions are valuable were they to be believed.
In chapters 5–8, Wrenn considers four different Value-Conferral Theories of the value of truth. On each theory, the truth of a proposition confers value on believing that proposition. The four theories differ in the specific value the proposition has.
In chapter 5, Wrenn considers the view that the truth of a proposition makes believing it conducive to achieving our goals or ends (90, 91). Some standard arguments for this conclusion are that true beliefs about effective means help us achieve our goals, and acting on false beliefs may be dangerous. Wrenn objects that these arguments fail because achieving or failing to achieve our goals turns on a range of factors beyond the truth or falsity of specific beliefs. Further, Wrenn argues, even when our true beliefs are conducive to our goals or ends it is not because the truth of a proposition makes this so (102–3, 105).
In chapter 6, Wrenn considers the view that the truth of a proposition makes believing it intrinsically valuable, which is characterized as “valuable by [its] nature” (111). Wrenn assumes that if true beliefs are valuable by their nature, then every true belief would be intrinsically valuable. He argues that they are not by appealing to “pointless truths,” which are true beliefs that have no value independent of whatever value being true confers on them (115). He argues that if beliefs in pointless truths are intrinsically valuable, then there’s a correct price you should be willing to pay to have them. But, intuitively, you are not wrong in refusing any price for having a pointless truth (120). Pointless truths are of neutral value not intrinsic value (123).
In chapter 7, Wrenn considers the view that the truth of a proposition makes believing it “epistemically valuable” such that our standards for deciding what to believe may be explained and rationalized by the epistemic value of true beliefs (132, 134–5). Wrenn’s evaluation of this view is more complex. He claims that we need the concept of TRUE because it provides the right level of generalization for us to use when evaluating our epistemic standards (143). Nonetheless, our desire for truth does not explain or rationalize those standards (143, 144).
In chapter 8, Wrenn considers the view that the truth of a proposition makes believing it “epistemically valuable” insofar as true beliefs are the constitutive goal of inquiry (147). Wrenn’s response here is more straightforward: true beliefs aren’t the constitutive goal of inquiry. For one may inquire into whether or not Q, while knowing (and thus having a true belief) as to whether or not Q. Rather, Wrenn claims, the goal of inquiry is to improve one’s epistemic position (162–5). And one can improve one’s position, with regard to a question while still knowing the answer to that question.
Wrenn’s book lies at the intersection of theories of truth, epistemic normativity, and value theory. It is most naturally read as a defense of Aristoteliean theories about the nature of truth from objections that they cannot accommodate the value of truth. So authors working on the nature of truth will be interested in the arguments here. But epistemologists working on epistemic normativity may also want to engage some of Wrenn’s views about epistemic normativity and the value of true beliefs.
Wrenn’s book is very readable. The book is quite short—less than 190 pages. Wrenn frequently repeats major ideas and theses, so it is easy to get the basic ideas being defended. Many of the sentences are short and uncomplicated. The prose would be readily accessible to undergraduates. ( The same holds for international readers, who might, though, have preferred a diet of examples not so predominately American.) However, academic researchers might have hoped for a longer book that engaged more authors and ideas. While Wrenn discusses a number of prominent authors and ideas, the book does not provide an exhaustive or systematic discussion of its topics. For instance, chapter 7 is mostly a discussion of two authors, and it is not hard to imagine additional views that could have been discussed in that chapter. Relatedly, while the basic ideas of the book are easy to identify, it also exhibits some terminological fluidity where a view (e.g., deflationism) or property (e.g., intrinsic value) are given several closely related characterizations. Academic researchers may have to work hard to see which of the characterizations is the most relevant to the specific argumentation of the chapters.
The book is brimming with arguments. My summary has been necessarily selective, omitting a range of additional arguments from each chapter. There are both criticisms of existing arguments in the literature as well as defenses of Wrenn’s own arguments. Some of the argumentative moves are novel—such as the appeal to generic desires in chapter 3—whereas others are well-known—such as using pointless truths to criticize the intrinsic value of true beliefs in chapter 6. But there is a fair bit of material here for others to critically engage and build upon.
With the exception of a few sections in chapter 3 (51–68), Wrenn spends little time developing a theory of the nature of truth. Rather, for the most part, he adopts an Aristotelian Theory, specifically, a deflationist theory of the nature of truth. Consequently, I expect most discussion will not revolve around his theory of the nature of truth. Rather, most discussion will revolve around Wrenn’s evaluations of theories of the value of true belief—both his rejection of Value-Conferral Theories and his defense of the State-Given Theory.
One worry is that the State-Given Theory doesn’t actually imply that true beliefs are valuable, and so fails as a theory of the value of truth. Suppose Wrenn is right that a virtue is a trait that promotes the overall good. And suppose that Truthfulness is a virtue. And suppose that desiring true beliefs is part of being Truthful. How does it follow that the object of that desire—true beliefs—is, itself, valuable? After all, it is not generally true that the objects of attitudes that are parts of virtues (vices) are necessarily valuable (disvaluable). (To take an obvious example: courage is a virtue; part of courage is believing certain things are dangerous; but it doesn’t follow that those dangerous things are also valuable or good!)
On some theories of virtue, sometimes virtues involve having attitudes that are appropriate responses to things of value and disvalue. Further, those appropriate attitudes are, themselves, valuable and disvaluable. Thus, having appropriate responses to things of value and disvalue is a way of promoting overall value or goodness. I think this theory of virtue is quite plausible (see Perrine 2023). And it would imply that the objects of some attitudes that are part of virtues are valuable. But Wrenn could not use this theory since it would require that true beliefs are valuable prior to, and independent of, the virtue of Truthfulness.
Wrenn might argue that: there are reasons that explain why we ought to be Truthful; desiring true beliefs is part of being truthful; therefore, there are reasons that explain why we ought to desire true beliefs; therefore, true beliefs are valuable. But this last step is widely thought to be fallacious. It is generally false that if there are reasons that explain why we ought to desire φ, then φ is valuable. Crisp’s original counterexample is good enough here (2000: 459): there is a reason that explains why I ought to desire a saucer of mud, namely, if I don’t, an evil demon will torment me. But it does not follow that the saucer of mud is valuable. So the State-Given Theory may need more amendments and clarifications before it implies that true beliefs are valuable.
Despite my worries about the State-Given Theory, this book is easy to recommend to authors working on the nature of truth or the epistemic normativity of beliefs. It’s on interesting and important topics; its short and easy to read; and its full of arguments. While a more ambitious and extensive book would also have been welcome, the present book offers a concise and coherent set of views worth engaging.
ACKNOWLEDGEMENT
Thanks to Chase Wrenn for help on this review.
REFERENCES
Crisp, Roger. 2000. Review of Value. . .And What Follows. Philosophy. 75;293: 458–462.
Perrine, Timothy. 2023. “Value Approaches to Virtue and Vice.” Acta Analytica. 38: 613–626.