In this ambitious book, Fiocco defends two remarkable theses. The first is the claim that the world is ontologically flat, “that each thing is fundamental; that reality has no ontological levels and […] that no thing is grounded in or made to be by another” (xv). The second is a version of the presentist thesis that nothing exists that is not present. While promoting presentism itself is not all that remarkable, Fiocco tries to make an unusually strong case. Rather than appeal to common sense or philosophical intuition, he claims to provide irrefutable, knock-down arguments for both of his theses.
These knock-down arguments are said to emerge from Fiocco’s fundamentalist approach to metaphysics, which he calls “original inquiry”. This inquiry is occasioned by confronting the world (“all this”), and it aims to answer the question “What is all this?” without taking anything for granted. Such a presuppositionless inquiry is said to permit us to “move past stalemate in metaphysical discussions” (22) and to lead us to the undeniable truth about time and the world, which includes Fiocco’s two theses.
To make progress with original inquiry, Fiocco thinks that we first need to address the fundamental ontological question “What is a thing?” (11). As he clarifies, “a thing is just an entity, an existent, a being” (60). Many philosophers will doubt that anything interesting can be said about things, in this general sense, that goes beyond the trivial observation that things are whatever quantifiers range over and singular terms denote. Fiocco disagrees. For him, elucidating the notion of thinghood is the most important question in metaphysics, and what ultimately leads to his two main theses.
Original inquiry provides Fiocco with the theoretical framework for a rich and wide-ranging discussion that spans almost the entire breadth of contemporary metaphysics. There is far more material in this book than one can hope to cover in a short review. Instead of saying a little bit about many different topics, I think it might be more helpful to focus on Fiocco’s main arguments for his two theses, which are contained in two very short passages on p. 77 and p. 179, respectively. The nothing-explains-anything argument on p. 77 promotes a radical restriction on the possibility of explanation; the farrago argument on p. 179 advocates a novel objection to eternalist thesis that past, present, and future are equally real.
My plan for this review is to give a detailed exposition of these two pivotal arguments, plus a quick survey of the rest of the book.
No Thing Explains Any Thing (p. 77)
After spending the first seventy pages on a leisurely (and somewhat repetitive) exposition of original inquiry, Fiocco’s answer to the fundamental ontological question arises quite suddenly. On p. 73, he tells us that things are the ontological bases of explanations for the diversity in the world (“all this”). As it is given to us, the world is not uniform. The function of things is to explain this diversity. This might sound quite innocent, but the subsequent discussion reveals that Fiocco’s view is not that things can explain but that they must explain for them to count as things at all. It is not obvious how an original inquirer, who is not supposed to assume anything, arrives at this view. Why can’t there be terminal explananda that are explained by other things but do not explain anything themselves?
A few pages later, we discover that Fiocco holds a much more radical view. He does not merely deny the existence of terminal explananda, which would be the end points of chains of explanations, he claims that there cannot be any chains of explanation at all because no thing can be explained by any other thing:
If how an entity, e, [is] were explicable (in its entirety) in terms of some other thing, e itself would be ontologically idle, making no contribution per se to how the world is; such an “entity” would, if anything, merely be a manifestation of the latter, that genuine existent. Hence, if there were something that made e how “it” is, e’s contribution to how the world is would be made by that thing that wholly determines or makes e how e is. Yet if e “itself” were not capable of contributing to a partial explanation for how all this is as it is, if “it” per se were insufficient to do at least this, e would be no thing at all. “It” could in principle make no contribution to the world and, therefore, is literally, nothing. (77)
It is not immediately clear whether the view is that an explanatory redundant e cannot exist or that it cannot be a thing. This issue gets settled a little bit later, in Section 4.2, where Fiocco argues that the world is not a thing because all this is explained by all the things there are, and we are supposed to have learned on p. 77 that no thing is explained by any other thing. This is an unexpected discovery. The world is the starting point of original inquiry and denying its existence is not a viable option. So how can it, the world, fail to be a thing? Fiocco does not seem to be using ‘thing’ in the liberal sense that he advertised earlier, when he told us that “a thing is just an entity, an existent, a being” (60). Since the world exists, it is presumably an “existent”, yet Fiocco explicitly denies that it is a thing. To make sense of Fiocco’s theory of thinghood, it appears that ‘no thing’ cannot mean the same as ‘nothing’, the negated existential quantifier (¬∃).
Even if we restrict ourselves to every thing (rather than everything), we might wonder why explanatory redundance entails non-thinghood. Suppose that d explains e and that e explains part of the diversity in all this. Assuming the transitivity of explanation, the presence of d would render the intermediate e explanatorily redundant. But this does not change the fact that e also explains part of all this. Compare the case of logical entailment. If p entails q and q entails r, then q is logically redundant in the sense that p already entails r on its own. But this does not change the fact q also entails r. So what mistake would an original inquirer make if she concluded that—despite its explanatory redundance—e still qualifies as a thing because it does perform what Fiocco has identified as the essential function of things, which is to explain all this? In other words, why doesn’t the fact that d performs the same explanatory role merely show that d and e are both things? Fiocco’s very short argument does not address this question.
In the second paragraph on p. 77, Fiocco presents another argument for the thesis that “no thing can be made to be by something else”. There, he argues as follows. Suppose for the sake of reductio that x explains the existence of y, and that “x makes to be y” (as Fiocco puts it). For x and y to stand in the makes-to-be relation to each other, both need to exist, which means that the existence of y is a pre-condition of its standing in this relation. Hence it cannot be by entering into the makes-to-be relation that y exists. Fiocco concludes that the existence of y cannot be determined by x. No thing is made to be by another thing.
Fatema Amijee (2026) objects that there is no reason why this argument needs to be restricted to every thing rather than to everything. If the argument succeeds at all, then it also shows that nothing explains anything, and not just that no thing explains any thing. We would get the conclusion that explanation is impossible, including the explanation of the diversity in all this that is supposed to be the hallmark of things. (See Fiocco 2026 for a reply to Amijee.)
While Fiocco focusses on grounding explanations, his argument would apply equally well to causal explanations. Consider your relation to your parents. Since nobody is a parent without any children, your existence is a pre-condition to anyone bearing the parent-relation to you. But it does not follow from this that you do not owe your existence to your parents or that your existence is somehow inexplicable. The parent-relation merely reflects the fact that your parents made you. The relation did not create you; your parents did. Friends of ontological levels might reply in the same way to Fiocco’s argument against grounding. What makes it the case that y exists is the existence of its ground x, not x’s standing in the makes-to-be relation to y. Nobody claims that the makes-to-be relation makes y; what makes to be y is x. The ground is doing the grounding, not the grounding relation. Perhaps there is more to be said about these issues, but Fiocco does not elaborate. The entire nothing-explains-anything argument, which is the linchpin of his view on ontology, occurs on the single page p. 77.
The Farrago Argument (p. 179)
Fiocco’s account of the nature of time emerges in Chapters 5–11 as a corollary of his broader views about original inquiry and the fundamental ontological question. Section 5.3 argues that we must distinguish time and moments, and that the former generates the latter: “Time is a thing in the world, the necessarily existing substance that enables change by yielding the moments that it requires” (135). Over the next one hundred and eighty pages, these ideas get turned into a theory of time that Fiocco calls ‘transient presentism’.
While developing his positive view, Fiocco touches on countless other issues in the philosophy of time, but most of this discussion is really an intramural debate amongst different versions of presentism. The main rival to all versions of presentism—the eternalist view that past, present, and future are equally real—gets dispatched with a quick argument that starts at the bottom of p. 179 and that is as pivotal to Fiocco’s views about time as the nothing-explains-anything argument is to his views about ontology. This “farrago argument” combines a reflection on how the world (“all this”) is given to us and an unusual claim about how the world would appear if eternalism were right:
If one is at a moment, m1, experiencing the world as thus and just as real at an equally real moment, m2, experiencing the world as so, then one should be having—at both moments—an experience of the world as thus and as so… [W]ere temporal reality ontologically homogeneous, there would be some conflation of the experiences one has at m1 and m2… [O]ne’s experience would be some farrago of the things at both moments. (179)
If eternalism could be refuted by the farrago argument, then the only remaining question would be which particular version of presentism is correct, and how such a presentism fits into Fiocco’s theory of things. That is how Fiocco views the matter, but I doubt many eternalists will be converted by this argument.
As far as I can tell, nobody accepts the spatial or modal counterpart of the farrago argument. Suppose that one person is freezing in Antarctica and another is sweltering in the Sahara. The fact that Antarctica and the Sahara are equally real does not entail that both people would have a farrago of both experiences. At different places, people are having different experiences. Similar remarks apply to the modal case, where an actual person might be experiencing the actual world as thus and a merely possible person might be experiencing some merely possible world as so. Modal realists think that both possible worlds are equally real, but they do not think that the inhabitants of both worlds would experience a farrago of both experiences. In different possible worlds, people are having different experiences.
One might be impressed by the fact that, in the temporal case, the experiences could be had by the same person at both moments, rather than by different people at different places or by different people in different possible worlds. However, many eternalists subscribe to a metaphysics of temporal parts on which persons persist through time by possessing different temporal parts. On such a view, it would be these temporal parts that are having the various experiences. The person-at-m1 who experiences the world as thus is distinct from the person-at-m2 who experiences the world as so, just as the freezing person in Antarctica is distinct from the sweltering person in the Sahara.
The farrago argument suggests that Fiocco rejects the widely held view, sometimes attributed to Einstein, that “time is what keeps everything from happening at once”. Fiocco might well be right about this, but I am not sure that, as it stands, his very brief presentation of the farrago argument will make many converts. As with the nothing-explains-anything argument, I think we would need a more detailed defense of the farrago argument to “move past stalemate in metaphysical discussions” (22). Otherwise, the friends of ontological levels will reject the nothing-explains-anything argument, eternalists will reject the farrago argument, and we are back at the “stalemate”.
How to Read this Book
As I said before, there is much more material in this book that one could address in a short review. Those who are interested in learning everything about Fiocco’s views on ontology and time should employ the “classical” method of reading the book cover to cover. Others might want to structure their engagement with Fiocco’s work around the two pivotal arguments that I have highlighted here. Those who are interested in ontology should start with the nothing-explains-anything argument on p. 77 and then decide whether to read Chapters 2–4, which contain Fiocco’s account of ontology (minus the bits about time). The best approach to reading the discussion of time in Chapters 5–11 depends on one’s antecedent views about time. Committed eternalists should go straight to p. 179 and take a closer look at the farrago argument. Those who have already been converted to presentism might want to start with Section 10.1, where Fiocco compares his transient presentism with other variants of presentism. Either way, readers should consult Section 1.2, which gives a good overview of the entire book.
REFERENCES
Amijee, F. 2026. Whence Original Inquiry? Analysis, doi.org/10.1093/analys/anag003
Fiocco, O. 2026. Radical Ontology and the Limits of Inquiry. Analysis, doi.org/10.1093/analys/anag007