Social construction talk can be used to deny that certain things are real or that they exist objectively. Anti-realists take social constructs to depend on our beliefs and regard them as little more than projections. However, social construction can also be explicated in realist terms. Aaron Griffith offers a realist account of the social construction of social reality in three steps. [1] He argues that social constructs implicate patterns of interaction in ways which mean they can be causes. [2] Furthermore, those patterns are the truth makers of social constructs. [3] Finally, truths about social constructs are not themselves socially constructed.
[1] According to John Searle (1995) and Raimo Tuomela (2002), institutional reality is constructed by means of constitutive rules that are collectively accepted. Yet, their views differ in an important respect. Searle regards acceptance as a matter of belief. In contrast, Tuomela takes it to also encompass a disposition to act according to a rule. This implies that social constructs typically have causal consequences. And it is why Tuomela, in contrast to Searle, is a realist about social reality. In a similar vein, Griffith argues that the ‘social factors that socially construct…involve…the causal effects of our thinking and categorizing’ (65). As causation is the mark of the real, this claim is key to realism about the social.
[2] Griffith analyzes social construction in terms of truthmaking. Consider the fact that some piece of paper is money. For this to be a fact, he proposes, there must be a rule that specifies the conditions under which the social kind money is instantiated. Furthermore, those conditions must be met. Finally, the rule must be in force. It will be operative due to social factors. Now, the rule is a proposition that is made true by those factors. And they make it true that the social kind is instantiated. For a fact to be socially constructed is for it to depend on social factors in this way.
[3] Although true propositions about social constructs have social truth-makers, those truths are not themselves socially constructed. Griffith argues that ‘an entity φ makes a proposition p true iff p is true in virtue of φ and necessarily, if φ exists/obtains, then p is true’ (12). Thus, ‘the truthmaking relation obtains by metaphysical necessity’ (61). In this respect, truths about the social differ from social constructs, which are contingent. According to Griffith, social reality is up to us, because we can change it. But once the relevant social factors have been fixed, truths about social constructs are necessary.
The social ontology that Griffith offers is two-dimensional: social facts depend on rules, which depend on social factors. He develops his view in terms of Brian Epstein’s (2015) distinction between grounding and anchoring. The rules are grounding principles. They specify the conditions that have to be met for a social kind to be instantiated. Those conditions can but need not be social. For instance, the fact that a dollar bill is constituted by a piece of paper is not a social fact. Furthermore, the grounding principles are anchored by social factors. They set up a context in which the corresponding social kinds can be instantiated. Because of this, they are the truth-makers of social facts. Griffith is neutral about what the grounding relation is and mentions composition, constitution, and realization as options (94-95). But he forcefully argues that anchoring is a matter of truthmaking.
Griffiths defines social kind construction and social fact construction as follows:
Social kind K is non-causally socially constructed iff K’s grounding principle is made true by certain patterns of human social interaction.
For any social kind K and entity x, [x is K] is non-causally socially constructed iff [x is K] obtains and K’s grounding principle is made true by certain patterns of human social interaction. (94)
These definitions reveal that the anchors of grounding principles are patterns of interaction.
The fact that anchors are truth-makers has an important consequence, which distinguishes Griffith’s theory from Epstein’s. Truth-makers are worldbound: there can be ‘truths about the social world only where grounding principles have been anchored and social facts grounded’ (128). Hence, ‘all social truth arises only in a social context’ (128). As a consequence, there is a limit to the extent to which social kinds can travel. In contrast, Epstein argues that social kinds that are anchored in one context can be instantiated in another one. This explains why he believes it makes sense to say of Genghis Khan that he was a war criminal. Griffith’s theory supports the more intuitive answer that it does not make sense to assert this.
The structure of Griffith’s theory is rather convincing. But I am puzzled by his claim that rules are anchored by patterns of interaction. He argues that ‘rules need not be believed, uttered, or otherwise an object of an attitude in order to be operative in society’ (85). However, rules can be in force only if they are somehow represented. Perhaps Griffith believes that the patterns of interaction represent the rules. However, such patterns are rarely uniform. Furthermore, as Wittgenstein pointed out, any pattern is consistent with many rules. It follows that, if grounding principles are rules, they cannot be anchored by patterns of interaction only.
According to what I call ‘the Hybrid Alternative’, the rules are anchored not only by patterns of interaction, but also by attitudes. Now, the attitudes people have towards the rules explain their actions and thereby the patterns of interaction. For instance, someone’s belief that a piece of paper is money plays a causal role with respect to her using it as a means of exchange. Griffith acknowledges this when he claims, as mentioned earlier, that the ‘social factors that socially construct…involve…the causal effects of our thinking and categorizing’ (65). However, anchors stand in a non-causal relation to the rules. It follows that grounding principles non-causally depend on attitudes and actions, which stand in a causal relation to one another.
Does it make sense to mix causal and non-causal relations in this way? To make progress with this issue, consider the dynamics of social construction. Ian Hacking (1999) argued that ‘human kinds’ depend on categories that we apply to people. But those to whom the categories are applied react to this in ways that require us to adjust those categories. As he regards such change as rampant, Hacking is an anti-realist about social kinds, more specifically a nominalist. However, there seem to be situations where this looping process issues in a stable state or equilibrium, where the attitudes that feature those categories are in sync with the actions performed by those to whom they are applied (Hindriks, 2025).
So, the attitudes and actions involved in social kinds are interdependent. This could be taken to support the idea that, if stable enough, the looping process anchors the rule. And this is consistent with the Hybrid Alternative.
In his informal discussion, Griffith is more permissive about the social factors that anchor social kinds than in his formal definitions. First, he allows for attitudes as anchors. Racial kinds form an interesting case. Griffith proposes that they are anchored by false beliefs and unconscious stereotypes in combination with how members of such kinds are treated. These attitudes and actions make the grounding principle true. And the fact that they are mistaken or distorted explains why the social kind is covert: why the social nature of race is hidden from us. For my purposes here, the important point is that the cost of switching from his formal or pure view to the Hybrid View may be limited.
Yet, the Hybrid Alternative faces a problem of its own. Many social kinds have a normative or deontological dimension. Think, for instance, of the fact that a one-dollar bill is legal tender. This implies that it must be accepted in payment of a debt. Griffith explicates this dimension in terms of normative constraints and enablements. They can feature in grounding principles. But they can also be related to the social kind contingently. Either way, the anchors form ‘the root’ of the normative constraints and enablements… They ‘function to enforce [their] boundaries through stereotype, censure, shame, and the like’ (104).
Now, suppose that the normative constraints and enablements feature in the grounding principle of a social kind. In that case, they are rules. But normative, instead of descriptive. If people comply with such a rule, their actions form a pattern that is characteristic of the social kind. But this will be the very pattern that anchors the rule. It follows that the grounding principle is anchored by its own causal consequences, which seems odd. To be sure, it is consistent with the Hybrid Alternative. Yet, it seems to be in tension with the fact that anchors are more fundamental than grounding principles.
What I call ‘the Pure Alternative’, according to which social kinds are anchored by attitudes only, is more attractive in this respect. The idea is that people have attitudes towards rules, which can be descriptive as well as normative. Furthermore, those attitudes ground the rules. Finally, normative rules have causal consequences: actions that constitute patterns. And these patterns reinforce the anchors. In this way, the Pure View avoids a commitment to the idea that anchors consist of the causal consequences of grounding principles. Furthermore, it avoids mixing causal and non-causal relations. So, the Pure View accommodates normative rules in an attractive way.
But how do normative rules relate to descriptive rules? Elsewhere, I have proposed a two-dimensional account of constitutive rules that answers this question. I distinguish between base rules and status rules. Base rules specify the conditions (X) that have to be met for a social kind (Y) to be instantiated in a context (C). They can be seen as grounding principles. Status rules specify the deontic powers (Z) of a normative social kind (Y). These rules are in force if they are generally acknowledged. Because they have a status term in common, these two kinds of rules clarify how the two dimensions of social kinds are related (Hindriks, 2025).
This ‘status account’ of constitutive rules has two other attractive features. First, base rules and status rules can be condensed into a single rule of the form: In C, (if X, then Z). Because of this, the proposal applies to social kinds for which people have not introduced a term, which are implicit in our practices. (And it avoids the mistake Searle and Tuomela make, that of reifying constitutive rules.) Second, the status account extends to non-normative social kinds. If a social kind does not have a deontological dimension, its status rule specifies not what is obligatory, but what is rational to do in the situation—how people can successfully coordinate or cooperate. Thus, it treats normative and non-normative social kinds symmetrically.
Truth & Social Reality is an utterly enjoyable, insightful, and penetrating book. It provides a lucid and, for the most part, convincing theory of social construction, truth, social contexts, as well as, I should add, vagueness in the social world. Thus, it offers a powerful framework for understanding the structure of social reality in a realist manner. Yet, I believe, the metaphysics offered in this book could benefit from a theory of social structures, one which illuminates the relations between attitudes, actions, and anchors, and those between the descriptive and normative dimensions of social reality.
REFERENCES
Epstein, Brian. 2015. The Ant Trap: Rebuilding the Foundations of the Social Sciences. Oxford University Press.
Hacking, Ian. 1999. The Social Construction of What? Harvard University Press.
Hindriks, Frank. 2025. The Structure of the Open Society: Social Ontology Meets Collective Ethics. Oxford University Press.
Searle, John R. 1995. The Construction of Social Reality. The Free Press.
Tuomela, Raimo. 2002. The Philosophy of Social Practices. Cambridge University Press.