Interest in the thought of the later Wittgenstein was hugely revived by Saul Kripke’s groundbreaking Wittgenstein On Rules and Private Language, first published in 1982. As is well known, in that book, Kripke developed a skeptical problem about the possibility of meaning and rule-following that he found in Wittgenstein’s later writings. The intuitive notion of following a rule that Kripke was working with can be summarized in terms of the following ACER model (see Boghossian 2008).
(Acceptance) If S is following rule R (‘If C, do A!’), then S has accepted (or ‘internalized’) R.
(Correctness) If S is following rule R, and it is the case that C, then S acts correctly if he does A; incorrectly otherwise.
(Explanation) If S is following rule R by doing A, then S’s acceptance of R explains S’s doing A.
(Rationalization) If S is following rule R by doing A, then S’s acceptance of R rationalizes S’s doing A.
The skeptical problem Kripke focused on is generated by the fact that most of the rules we follow—and most especially, those that capture what it is for us to mean something by a word—are infinitary rules. These are rules that specify how it would be correct for us to behave if we are to conform to the rule. And the Kripkensteinian problem, in a nutshell, is that it is hard to see how our finite minds could enjoy states that contained information about how it would be correct for us to behave in endless distinct situations. A constraint on an acceptable solution will involve showing how whatever state is said to be the state of accepting rule R is able to explain and rationalize the rule-follower’s R-directed behavior. Call this Kripke’s Acceptance Problem, and his thesis that we cannot make sense of such states his Skeptical Conclusion.
The first wave of responses to Kripke focused on evaluating the strength of his argument for this potentially highly destructive Skeptical Conclusion. While not everyone agreed that Kripke had succeeded in nailing the Skeptical Conclusion, a significant number of philosophers—including Crispin Wright, Colin McGinn, John McDowell, Barry Stroud and Paul Boghossian—came away from the discussion convinced that Kripke had at least shown that reductionist (typically dispositionalist/functionalist) accounts of rule-following could not be correct, even if his arguments left non-reductionist accounts relatively unscathed. Matters stood thus until some of these very same anti-reductionists claimed to discover further problems with rule-following, ones not anticipated by Kripke and which arise even if one grants the viability of a non-reductionist response to Kripke’s original Acceptance Problem.
Alex Miller’s book is a wonderfully clear and searching exploration of this ‘second wave’ of problems for the notion of rule-following, which is not to say that he does not discuss Kripke’s original problem as well. Indeed, Miller’s view is that the correct solution to the second wave problems allows us to make better sense of the anti-reductionist solutions to Kripke’s Acceptance Problem. Miller is probably the foremost expert on the extensive literature on rule-following, and it is a pleasure to be guided by him through its occasionally thorny intricacies.
The second wave was kicked off by Crispin Wright (2017, 2012) with his ‘Minor Premise Problem’. This problem applies to the rules picture when it is used to capture linguistic understanding. Suppose you say that for S to mean green by ‘green’ is for S to use ‘green’ according to the rule:
‘Green’ applies to green things.
To apply this rule in any given case, one would have to think about some object
This is a green thing
to conclude:
I may apply ‘green’ to it.
And the problem, according to Wright, is that in using this rule to apply the word ‘green’ to something, one would have to think the minor premise, and this would itself deploy the concept green.
Why should this be considered a problem? There are two circumstances under which there would be a big problem here. The first would arise if we could not avail ourselves of something like the ‘Augustinian’ picture of language derided in the Investigations, according to which concept possession is independent of and can precede linguistic understanding. But there really is considerable empirical evidence that something like the Augustinian picture is correct in rough outline (see Chomsky 1988 and surrounding literature).
The second relevant circumstance is one in which concept possession itself has to be construed on analogy with the rulish picture of linguistic understanding, as consisting in our following a rule with respect to an expression. This need not be the Augustinian picture all over again, provided that the expressions in question are not expressions of a natural language but rather expressions in a hypothesized ‘language of thought,’ sometimes referred to as ‘Mentalese’. For if so, the rulish picture of conceptual understanding, along with the assumption that the rule in question is represented in the subject’s head, would be sufficient to generate a vicious regress all on its own. However, especially against the backdrop of an assumed anti-reductionism about concept possession, it’s unclear why the rulish construal of concept possession would appeal.
Whatever we might make of the Minor Premise Problem, it can serve as a springboard for illustrating a more general ‘second wave’ problem about following a rule, one that doesn’t arise only when the rules picture is applied to the notion of linguistic understanding. What Wright assumes, in the course of laying out his Minor Premise Problem, is that S will follow the rule for ‘green’ by inferring, via Modus Ponens, that it applies in any particular case. However, inferring via Modus Ponens would appear to be a paradigm example of following a rule: it’s an example of precisely the type of infinitary normative capacity for which rules need to be invoked. But there looks to be a problem with combining a rule-following view of logical inference (RFI) with an inferential model of following a rule (IRF). To see this, consider the
(Email Rule) If x is an email that you have just received, and it calls for a reply, answer it immediately.
On the IRF, to follow this rule, I would have to infer from the rule plus the minor premise
X is an email I have just received, and it calls for a reply
to conclude that I ought to reply to it immediately. However, on the RFI, this inference itself involves following the rule Modus Ponens. To perform it, I would have to follow the rule:
(MP) From any premises of the form P and If P, Q, you may infer Q.
Given the IRF, to be guided by MP, I would have to reason as follows from MP:
MP: Given premises of the form P and If P, Q, I may infer Q.
These premises are of the form P and If P, Q.
So, I may infer Q.
Given that this is itself inference, and given the RFI, it would itself have to be rule-governed. So, it would itself have to involve following another rule:
MP*: Given MP and the fact that my premises are of the form P and If P, Q, I may infer Q.
MP.
And so on…
If this is right, then given the RFI, if rule-following involves guidance by the rule, that guidance can’t always be inferential. This is the Inference Problem developed in Boghossian (2008, 2012).
If the Inference Problem is sound, we face a choice. On the assumption that we don’t want to give up on the notion of rule-following altogether, we must either find a way in which a rule might guide behavior non-inferentially, or we must give up on the idea that rules need to guide behavior.
How might we both have rules in our picture and have no guidance of behavior by those rules? The answer can only be that rules don’t guide the behavior because they are the behavior. In other words, we would get a dispositionalist reduction of rule-following, something that we know to reject on the basis of Kripke’s original arguments. So, our only real option is to make sense of rules that guide behavior, but which do so non-inferentially. And there is a puzzle here: how could a rule—a general, conditional content—explain and rationalize behavior without this involving inference from that content?
As mentioned above, Miller’s view is that both the Wright and Boghossian problems turn on a mistake, and that once this mistake is corrected, the way is paved for an unstinting acceptance of an anti-reductionist solution to Kripke’s original problem. According to Miller, the mistake consists in ignoring Wittgenstein’s dictum that there is a way of following a rule that is not an interpretation.
What does following a rule without interpretation amount to? According to Miller, it amounts to following a rule R in a way that doesn’t depend on following some other rule R*, which will tell you what following R requires (91). But if that is what it amounts to, it would appear obvious that there must be a way of following a rule that does not involve interpretation: the alternative is obviously viciously regressive. If following any rule R requires one to follow some other rule R*, then following any rule would be a ‘super-task’, and so no rule could be followed.
Miller’s contribution is not so much that observation but rather the provision of a positive account about how it is possible for a rule to guide one’s behavior non-inferentially. Miller’s positive account is also inspired by Wittgenstein: it draws on the latter’s frequent suggestion that the key to explaining how a rule may guide one non-inferentially involves the notion of training, custom or practice.
How exactly should that be understood? No one will deny, of course, that in creatures like us training may be a causal prerequisite to our coming to be able to conform to a given rule. When I was a child, I was taught what a standing red man and a walking green man meant at crosswalks; and how to use those signs to cross the street safely. But that looks to be a contingent fact about how those signs guide my behavior, not a constitutive fact about how they are able to guide it non-inferentially.
Miller’s response to this worry is not entirely clear:
On the view I am proposing, what is the relationship between training and facts about rules or content? In particular is it constitutive: are facts about contents or the requirements of rules constituted by facts about training?…The view proposed is not that facts about training constitute …the requirements imposed by rules….The view proposed is that training, and the participation in practices or customs that it makes possible, can simultaneously put you in a position to grasp these…requirements, and incline you towards acting in accord with them. So, for people who—as things are—require to be trained in order to participate, there is an internal relationship between accepting a rule and being inclined to act in accord with it. But it is not part of the view that a Martian couldn’t grasp one of these contents and thereby be inclined to act differently, nor is it part of the view that they could. The view proposed is neutral on this question. (146-147)
It sounds like what Miller wants to say is that although the training is not metaphysically constitutive for grasping and following a rule, it may be nomologically necessary for creatures like us. But it’s not clear why this isn’t merely to provide a causal connection between the rule and its application; as a result, it’s not clear why it is responsive to the Inference Problem it is meant to solve.
The Inference Problem is a how-possible problem: how is it possible for general conditional content to non-inferentially guide your behavior in a way that explains and rationalizes it? Miller says that training with a particular signpost brings it about that you grasp the meaning of the signpost and are able to act in accordance with it. Since we are helping ourselves to the grasp bit, the puzzle reduces to the question: how does this grasped content explain and rationalize your behavior without inference mediating the transition?
Miller wants to say that it is training with the sign that brings this about but not because the training is somehow constitutive of the transition, but because it may be causally necessary in creatures like us. There look to be several problems with this proposal (which has echoes in proposals made by others—see e.g., Devitt and Roberts, 2024).
The first is that it simply doesn’t address the question of how it is possible for the guidance to be rationalizing without being inferential because, for all that’s been said so far, the training story is compatible with rule-guidance always being inferential. Thus, perhaps what the training does is teach me how to infer what to do from the various signs. The standing red man means: stop, don’t cross. I am at a crosswalk, and the light is showing a standing red man. Hence, I should stop.
Second, any story in terms of training is presumably derivative rather than fundamental. I can train you to acquire an ability only if I have it myself. Doesn’t this imply that someone must have acquired the ability for the first time without the benefit of training by others?
We may contrast Miller’s solution with the one proposed by Boghossian (unpublished ms.), which owes to a suggestion originally made by David Velleman (in oral comments on Boghossian 2008, given at the NYU Mind and Language Seminar). Consider again the Email Rule. Following Wright, we may say that to accept this rule is basically to form the general intention to answer any email that calls for an answer immediately upon receipt. How could this general conditional content guide behavior non-inferentially? The key thought is that it is constitutive of your having this intention that you have some disposition to conform to it. That is, forming the intention to answer any email immediately upon receipt constitutively involves acquiring the disposition to answer any email upon receipt.
This is not to collapse back into the Dispositional View: the disposition is only partly constitutive of the intention, not fully constitutive of it. If we accept that intentions to follow rules can have constitutive connections to dispositions to conform to them, we seem to have the means with which to explain how the rules one has accepted could explain and rationalize one’s behavior non-inferentially, at least some of the time.
To see this, suppose that on some occasion I recognize an email that calls for a reply and respond to it immediately, thereby manifesting my disposition to conform to the Email Rule. I can do this, it would seem, without further consulting the rule and deducing what it calls for. So, the rule can certainly explanatorily cause the behavior without inference through the mechanism of the disposition. But does this count as rationalizing the behavior? Well, it certainly seems to count the Email Rule as the reason for which I respond as I do because my responding as I do is the operation of a disposition that is part of the intention which has the Email Rule as its content. The content of the intention explains and rationalizes why I have the disposition that I have. And that disposition in turn explains why I behave as I do. That is how, even without inference from the rule, the rule can count as the reason for which I do what I do.
None of this is to say that this type of solution has no challenges of its own; it’s simply to provide an example of a type of view that is perhaps more responsive to the Inference Problem than Miller’s picture.
Despite this reservation about Miller’s positive proposal, his book is highly recommended for anyone interested in this nexus of issues about rule-following and meaning. Miller has a commanding grasp of the landscape in which these issues are embedded and a wonderfully clear way of explaining them.
REFERENCES
Boghossian, P. (unpublished ms.). Guidance by Rules.
Boghossian, P. (2008). Epistemic Rules. Journal of Philosophy, 105(9), 472–500.
Chomsky, N. (1988). Language and Problems of Knowledge: The Managua Lectures. MIT Press.
Devitt, M., & Roberts, J. R. (2024). Changing Our Logic: A Quinean Perspective. Mind, 133(529), 61–85.
Kripke, S. A. (1982). Wittgenstein on Rules and Private Language: An Elementary Exposition. Harvard University Press.
Wright, C. (2007). Rule-Following Without Reasons: Wittgenstein’s Quietism and the Constitutive Question. Ratio, 20(4), 481–502.
Wright, C. (2012). Replies Part I: The Rule-Following Considerations and the Normativity of Meaning: Boghossian, Peacocke, Horwich, and Bilgrami. In A. Coliva (Ed.), Mind, Meaning, and Knowledge: Themes from the Philosophy of Crispin Wright (pp. 379–401). Oxford University Press.