Alison Stone’s Women on Philosophy of Art: Britain 1770–1900 is an edifying reconsideration of seven female British writers who made significant contributions to public thinking about the fine arts in the long nineteenth century, that is, from the end of the Enlightenment to the beginning of modernism. It is a careful analysis of selected works by Anna Barbauld (1743–1825), Joanna Baillie (1762–1851), Harriet Martineau (1802–76), Anna Jameson (1794–1860), Frances Power Cobbe (1822–1904), Emilia Dilke (1840–1904), and Vernon Lee (1856–1935) that aims to bring the art-related ideas of these largely forgotten authors back into contemporary view (1–3). Stone aspires, thereby, to enrich current conversations in the philosophy of art on topics of enduring concern, including the relationship between artistic and moral value, the allure of tragedy, the educational potential of fiction, and the nature of genius (13).
This monograph is a complex tapestry of archival materials and interpretation, unique in its approach and impressive in detail. Stone surveys her chosen subjects lovingly, putting their ideas into nuanced contexts that help us think along withthem as women who published in a particular time and place—nineteenth-century Britain (27). Despite her obvious affection for all seven writers, Stone never treats their words preciously. Instead, she deftly draws out internal tensions in their views while still convincing the reader that these “lost” perspectives are well-worth rediscovering in the twenty-first century.
This skillfully researched book will appeal to literary scholars of various persuasions. The intended audience, however, is academics who are steeped in the history of the philosophy of art but unfamiliar with the seven women Stone highlights (which is most of today’s practicing aestheticians). This creates a complication for reviewers—like me—who are her target readers: we can neither comment authoritatively on the historical resources she utilizes nor assess the plausibility of her interpretations of Barbauld, Baillie, et al. because Women on Philosophy of Art is designed to introduce us to these thinkers and their works. For this reason, my remarks emphasize elements of Stone’s style and method over specifics of the multi-layered views she reconstructs for present-day reconsideration.
As the replete introductory chapter attests, the monograph has multiple overlapping humanistic ambitions. These can, with some remainder, be distilled into a triad of interrelated argumentative aims: to demonstrate that (1) British women in the expanded Victorian era were revered public intellectuals who were (2) doing a practice-informed kind of philosophy of art that was (3) original in its theoretical contours (1–32, 58, 76).
With respect to the first objective, one might ask: Why undertake a defense of the dyadic claim that the writings selected for examination were widely read, and their authors “important, well known, and influential,” in their own time (1)? Stone advertises this aspect of her project as a corrective to what she urges is a mistaken assumption pervasive in contemporary feminist aesthetics, namely, that “the philosophical tradition was exclusively masculine until recent feminist challenges arose” (21). To bolster her alternative view “that women have been excluded from philosophy’s historiography, rather than its history” (21, emphasis mine), Stone is at pains throughout the book to demonstrate that not only did many Victorian women write thoughtfully about what are now regarded as significant issues in the philosophy of art, but their ideas were taken seriously by both the general public and the leading intellectuals of their day. Reinvigorated focus on female voices that were publicly strong will, she hopes, enable us to “revise what have become standard feminist interpretive frameworks” and, thereby, “help push feminist aesthetics in new directions” (23).
It remains to be seen if these disciplinary aspirations for Women on Philosophy of Art will be realized. I submit, however, that stressing the renown once enjoyed by this septet of British women serves an important stylistic purpose within the narrower context of Stone’s book: it generates intrigue that propels our reading. Many chapters begin with stunning statistics and bits of attention-grabbing trivia about the erstwhile popularity of the seven female writers Stone foregrounds, and several introductions feature arresting comparisons between these forgotten authors and their now-famous male counterparts.
At the top of chapter three, for example, we are apprised that Joanna Baillie “was the most celebrated British playwright of the earlier nineteenth century” (58) and that “There was widespread agreement with Walter Scott’s assessment that Baillie was ‘the best dramatic writer whom Britain has produced since the days of Shakespeare’” (59). Similarly, chapter five opens by noting that Anna Jameson was described regularly as a genius in nineteenth-century British periodicals; upon her death, we are told, she had acquired international reputation as an “almost unrivalled” art-critic, second only to John Ruskin (102). Chapter nine reveals that Vernon Lee’s vast body of written work on the fine arts was, somewhat later, also praised publicly as second only to that of Ruskin, outshining the now-canonical essays penned by Oscar Wilde and Walter Pater (197). And in chapter four we learn that Harriet Martineau was “Britain’s most famous female public intellectual” (78) and that her Illustrations of Political Economy (1832–34) outsold the writings of Charles Dickens more than three-fold in their time (78).
By beginning every chapter with insights into its subject’s nineteenth-century popularity, Stone continually piques our curiosity. This sustains us through dense descriptive passages designed to contextualize the intellectual life of each writer and propels us toward Stone’s thought-provoking reconstructions of seven distinct theories of art’s moral significance or spiritual character. Her captivating chapter introductions also support the second main argumentative line of the monograph, namely, that these British women were doing a distinctive kind of philosophy of art intimately bound up with both active artistic practice (authoring novels, short stories, plays, and children’s tales) and astute art criticism.
Stone argues that the wholesale absence of Barbauld, Baillie, et al. from discussions in the philosophy of art since the early twentieth century can be attributed, in part, to the style and form of their writings, which were often artistic reviews rather than philosophical essays or complex literary works rather than systematic treatises. “On the whole,” she writes, “for these women the boundary between art practice and art theory was porous . . . Practice and reflection shaped one another, and the writing of art filtered into writing about art and back again” (16). Thus, Stone works from a liberal conception of “doing philosophy” that authorizes her to move freely between novellas, plays, essays, and critical notices in reconstructing the art-related theses of her selected septet.
While there is something truly delightful about this approach, it might benefit from more detailed defense than Stone gives it. She conscientiously avoids placing any of her seven subjects in conversation with contemporary philosophers of art to ensure that we do not import modern sensibilities into our interpretations of their works. This way, Stone writes, “we can think with these women, rather than remodeling them into what we might want them to have been” (27). This is a laudable aim. However, by protecting their historical voices in this manner Stone also threatens to undermine her claim that in their non-specialist public writing they were actually doing philosophy.
Contemporary debates in the philosophy of art feature lively disagreement about whether artworks like films (and novels and plays) can properly be said to do philosophy, even when their content is uncontroversially philosophical. Furthermore, among those who defend the philosophical potential of the cinematic and literary arts, there is on-going dispute about how best to characterize the kind of intellectual work they are capable of doing. So, while Stone may have good reason not to compare Barbauld’s solution to the paradox of tragedy to Susan Feagin’s modern meta-response view, the book’s central thesis would be strengthened if she engaged the aforementioned meta-philosophical debates to some degree rather than restricting herself to discussion of texts penned in the long nineteenth century.
There are also many opportunities to wonder just how we should regard Stone’s assiduous reconstructions. For instance, in chapter four she argues that Martineau was a rather extreme kind of moralist, though she also admits that “Martineau never gave this position a single unified statement, so we have to piece it together from several textual sources” (78) and further concedes that “Martineau wrote less directly on the philosophy of art than the other six women covered in this book” (79). Honest qualifications of this kind appear in almost every chapter, and they might give some readers legitimate pause.
Reconstructive efforts in any field are a tricky business as they always involve both scholarly acumen and significant creative intervention. In a philosophical context, this multi-dimensional interpretative process makes the reconstruction of lost ideas especially vulnerable to challenge. Other scholars might draw on different sources to reach a competing conclusion. Colleagues might read the same resources through a different set of conceptual lenses or with a contrary intellectual goal in mind. Or different thinkers might simply arrange the argumentative puzzle pieces differently.
I believe Stone is aware of these dangers inherent in her project. She is also cognizant of the potential to be criticized for her choice of the seven women whose ideas she attempts to rehabilitate. Selection requires omission, and historically important stories about other forgotten Victorian women writers with an interest in the arts could, and should, be told.
For this reason, I conclude with my favorite element of Stone’s thoroughly impressive book: to address concerns like the aforementioned she does not offer an argument. Instead, she simply gestures at the possibility of a beautiful remedy by drawing on the metaphor of a kaleidoscope. “We rotate the cell, and one configuration comes into view while other pieces fall to the margins; but we remain aware that we could twist the cell again, and a new configuration would surface” (57). This imagery, inspired by Barbauld, promises a productive way to think about both historical reconstructions and academic canons, and Stone’s suggestive use of metaphor at this crucial point in the book is a testament to the seven women into whose stylish writings she breathes new philosophical life. It is a credit to Stone that Women on Philosophy of Art has both the intellectual and aesthetic power to inspire us to turn the lens.