Much human behavior is stimulus-free. While plants and many non-human animals respond reflexively to their present environment, our own actions are mediated by our ability to represent how the world has been and how it could be, and how we might alter it to achieve our goals. Philosophers who have explored the evolutionary pressures giving rise to representational cognition, such as Godfrey-Smith (1996) and Sterelny (2003), have emphasized the role played by environmental complexity. Armin Schulz suggests that an important part of this evolutionary story has been overlooked. He argues that representationally mediated behavior is adaptive because it is more cognitively efficient than reflex-driven behavior, under certain conditions.
When Schulz argues for the efficiency of representational decision-making, the representations in question are theoretical posits of cognitive science: physically implemented (often computational) internal states that are semantically evaluable and causally efficacious; the vehicles of representational content (Drayson 2018). Schulz distinguishes between broadly belief-like cognitive representations (of the organism's environment) and broadly desire-like conative representations (of the organism's goals), but this is not a book about propositional attitudes or practical reasoning. Schulz is interested in the explanatory and predictive roles that representations play in scientific theories of behavior generation, in which there is no assumption that their contents are propositional or consciously accessible.
But Schulz parts ways from cognitive science when he reserves the term 'representational' for high-level (i.e. non-perceptual, amodal) mental states that can participate in inferential processes: "distinct states that are downstream from their perceptual systems" (13). He classifies as reflex-driven any behavior which is not the result of amodal representations, which puts his approach in tension with cognitive science's commitment to low-level sensory and motor representations: consider the representations in computational models of the early visual system (Marr 1982), for example, and in comparator models of motor control (Wolpert 1997). Schulz also leaves it unclear how his notion of representation applies to different cognitive architectures: in a modular architecture, for example, would the representations in an encapsulated process (such as theory of mind, or language comprehension) count as being "downstream" from perception? And in predictive-processing architectures such as those developed by Clark (2013) and Hohwy (2013), the high-level non-perceptual representations are arguably upstream from (and not entirely distinct from) perception. Schulz's approach thus seems to work best for so-called "classical sandwich" models of cognitive architecture (Hurley 1998), on which the explanatory work is done by amodal representations mediating between perception and action, and sensory-motor processes are merely inputs and outputs.
Two further features of Schulz's approach are worth emphasizing. He is not concerned with the adaptivity of representational thought in general, nor with the adaptivity of a particular kind of behavior. He is specifically concerned with showing how the trait of decision-making (in both humans and non-humans) can be more cognitively efficient and adaptive when it employs internal representations. This relates to the second interesting feature of Schulz's approach, which is a terminological one. While it is common to reserve the term 'decision-making' for representational thinkers, he extends it to reflex-driven organisms: he describes the stimulus-driven behavior of ants, slime molds, and magnetotactic bacteria as the result of a non-representational decision-making processes. He advises readers who are uncomfortable with this to rephrase such talk in terms of 'behavior determination processes'. I will come back to both of these features below.
At the heart of Schulz's book is a question: why has representational decision-making evolved? Given that many organisms succeed by responding reflexively to environmental stimuli, what selection pressures would result in representationally-mediated behavior? His answer is that non-representational decision-making often involves a certain kind of redundancy which representational decision-making lacks. This redundancy occurs when more than one stimulus triggers the same behavioral response in a reflex-driven organism: the organism might have different ways of detecting a predator (by sight, by smell, by sound, for example) but have the same reflexive behavioral response (taking cover) to each kind of stimulus. Schulz points out that a table of such an organism's behavioral dispositions, listing each pairing of a sensory input with a behavioral output, could be lengthy; and a network diagram might require many connections to track the associations. he argues that the table of behavioral dispositions would be significantly shorter, and the network diagram would require fewer connections, if the different sensory cues were bundled into one internal representation of their distal cause (the predator). Employing representations in this way, Schulz claims, would "streamline decision making by allowing the organism to react to grouped perceptual states, rather than to the perceptual states themselves", making them "more cognitively efficient than non-representational decision makers" (97).
This streamlining of the connections between sensory input and behavioral output, however, is not sufficient to establish increased cognitive efficiency. The benefits gained by switching from reflexes to representations come with certain costs: a representation-using organism needs resources for storing, retrieving, and manipulating those representations. Inferential processes like these tend to use more time and cognitive resources than the non-inferential processes involved in reflexive processes of behavior determination. Schulz acknowledges this, but claims that non-representational decision-makers with large numbers of redundant behavioral dispositions can incur even greater costs. He argues that that a non-representational organism with "16 different behavioral dispositions to store and consider" (91, my italics) could reduce that number to eight by employing representations, concluding that "representational decision makers can get away with considering many fewer behavioral dispositions than reflex-based organisms have to" (104, my italics). Similarly, he proposes that an organism which can represent its goals can rely on just one explicitly-stored behavioral function, whereas the non-representational organism "relies on a stored table of all the argument-value pairs that make up this function" (121, my italics). Notice that Schulz is directly comparing the kinds of cognitive effort expended by representational and non-representational decision-makers: he thinks that both kinds of organism make decisions by storing and considering behavioral dispositions, and that cognitive efficiency increases where there are fewer dispositions to be stored and considered.
This is where Schulz's preference for referring to reflexive behavior as the result of 'decision-making' might be misleading. It does not seem odd to refer to decision-makers as storing and considering information, as he does in the above quotations, until we recall that Schulz's non-representational decision-makers are entirely reflex-driven. As such, they don't store tables of behavioral dispositions or consider which behavioral disposition to engage, at least not in the sense that representational organisms store and consider the information they represent. There will, of course, be metabolic costs incurred by reflex mechanisms, but it is not clear how we should compare these to the genuinely cognitive costs incurred by information-processing mechanisms that store and manipulate representations. Schulz's conclusion may be right: perhaps the costs associated with a sufficiently large number of reflex connections can be outweighed by the benefits of representations. But to evaluate this scenario, we need a more detailed account of cognitive efficiency, and an understanding of how to quantify different kinds of performance and effort. Should we, for example, calculate cognitive efficiency using a deviation model (using subtraction to calculate the difference between performance and effort) or a likelihood model (calculating the ratio between performance and effort)? Should we measure cognitive performance as an increase in the amount of information, or as in increase in the rate of accrual of information? These issues are addressed in the psychological literature on cognitive efficiency (see, for example, Hoffman 2012), but Schulz does not engage with them in his book. It would be interesting to see his argument re-run using these resources to clarify and contextualize the relative efficiency of representational and non-representational decision-makers.
If Schulz succeeds in showing that representational decision-making can be more cognitively efficient than non-representational decision-making, his next task is to show that cognitive efficiency contributes to the adaptivity of representational decision-making. His first argument for adaptivity claims that a representational decision-maker, in virtue of being more cognitively efficient than a non-representational decision-maker, will also be more efficient at altering its behavior in response to changes in the environment. Schulz proposes that while the representational decision-maker will need time and effort to change its behavioral rules, the non-representational decision-maker would need even more time and effort to alter its many redundant behavioral dispositions: "changing each behavioral disposition in a table of behavioral dispositions takes some time, concentration, attention, and energy" (122). The comparison, as before, is perhaps not as straightforward as Schulz suggests. The reflex-driven organism does not represent its table of behavioral dispositions, for example, and it is not clear why concentration and attention would be required for it to alter its stimulus-driven behavior. His claims would benefit from a more thorough account of cognitive efficiency and the measures it involves: without these, the relative adaptivity of representational and non-representational decision-makers is difficult to judge.
Schulz's second argument for the adaptivity of cognitive efficiency attempts to show that cognitive efficiency correlates with neural efficiency, and that neural efficiency is adaptive. His key example of neural efficiency is synaptic pruning: the process by which neuronal structures decay during development in mammals, including humans. But a reduction in neural connections or neural activation does not necessitate an increase in neural efficiency (Poldrack 2015). Synaptic pruning only leads to increased neural efficiency if its metabolic savings outweigh any decrease in performance (according to some quantifiable measure) and/or an increase in time; factors which Schulz does not consider. (He also does not establish that increased cognitive efficiency causes increased neural efficiency, but rather relies on correlational claims from the developmental literature.) Putting these issues aside, we can still ask whether neural efficiency is adaptive. As Schulz points out, it is metabolically costly to maintain a large brain. If there were increases in neural efficiency associated with synaptic pruning, for example, organisms could invest the conserved energy in more adaptive enterprises: enhancing other cognitive capacities or, he suggests, just to grow a larger body. The adaptivity of increased neural efficiency, however, doesn't seem to follow automatically. Much will depend on what the savings are used for, and how the environment is: a larger body is only adaptive in an environment where there is sufficient food to fuel it, for example.
If we allow Schulz his claims that neural efficiency is adaptive, that it is appropriately related to cognitive efficiency, and that representational decision-makers are plausibly more cognitively efficient than non-representational decision-makers, where does that leave us? Schulz's project starts from the idea that representational decision-making is an adaptation, and concludes that natural selection has favored representational decision-making over reflex-driven behavior determination in virtue of the fitness benefits from the former's cognitive efficiency. He does not make a lengthy case for taking decision-making to be an adaptation: he proposes that "selective explanations of the evolution of this trait should be thought quite plausible" (61) in virtue of its widespread nature and complexity. Establishing whether any psychological capacity is an adaptation is a thorny issue, but it is easier where the capacity is associated with a specific kind of behavior which can help us to infer the capacity's function. The supposed adaptivity of behaviors like recognizing faces, attributing mental states to others, or detecting social cheating are sometimes used to suggest that we have evolved specific psychological capacities with these individual functions. General-purpose psychological capacities like decision-making, however, do not give rise to any particular kind of behavior: "The function of a general cognitive mechanism is complex and indirect . . . No particular kind of behaviour is its mark" (Sterelny 1992, 171). And notice that if representational decision-making is an adaptation, it must at minimum be heritable and confer differential fitness benefits. Schulz makes no mention of the heritability of representational decision-making, and denies that its differential fitness benefits correspond to specific behaviors:
there need not be a fundamental difference in the kinds of things cognitive representational decision makers can do (as compared to purely reflex-driven organisms) for them to be selected for: a major adaptive benefit of cognitive representational decision making lies in its allowing for more efficient behavior generation, and not for its allowing for the generation of new kinds of behaviors. (102-3)
Thinking about the adaptivity of decision-making and the role of representational mechanisms brings to mind Mayr's (1961) distinction between ultimate and proximate explanations of traits. The ultimate cause of a trait is its evolutionary function (what it has been selected for); the proximate cause of a trait is the mechanism that produces it. If we want to explain the human ability to recognize familiar faces, for example, then we could specify the adaptive benefits of facial recognition (ultimate cause), or focus on the cognitive mechanisms that produce it (proximate cause). If we apply Mayr's distinction to decision-making, then questions about the selection pressures under which it evolved would be asking about its ultimate cause, and questions about the mechanisms that produce it (representational or otherwise) would be asking about its proximate cause. Schulz does not make use of Mayr's distinction, instead making claims which combine aspects of ultimate and proximate causes. He may have good reason to do so: several philosophers and scientists have questioned the usefulness of the ultimate/proximate distinction when dealing with certain phenomena including psychological traits (Laland et al. 2011). It would be interesting to know where Schulz stands on this matter.
I have already suggested that Schulz's focus on high-level non-perceptual representations is at odds with certain approaches to cognitive science. Embodied cognitive science, in particular, seems to challenge his claims. Proponents of embodied cognitive science reject the idea that sensory and motor processes are mere inputs and outputs to a mediating cognitive mechanism which is responsible for intelligent behavior. Instead, they argue that closely coupled sensory and motor processing can generate flexible behavior without the need for high-level mental states, amodal concepts, or inferential reasoning. For example, a female cricket's ability to locate a chirping mate might seem to require calculation and navigation, until we realize that the differential placement of its sense organs generates auditory phase patterns that guide the cricket toward its mate without any internal representations (Webb 2001). Moreover, embodied cognitive science often appeals to evolutionary considerations that favor their anti-representational approach, so their view is directly in competition with Schulz's claims about the adaptivity of representationally-driven behavior. He dedicates a chapter to addressing this issue, but focuses on extended cognition rather than embodied cognition. Both extended and embodied approaches to cognition reject 'neurocentric' approaches to the mind, but in different ways: embodied approaches emphasize how bodily sensors and effectors can replace representational processing in the brain, while extended approaches emphasize how the extra-bodily environment can supplement representational processing in the brain. There is thus nothing particularly anti-representational about extended cognitive science. In fact, many cases of putative extended cognition involve representational artefacts such as linguistic and numerical symbol systems, calendars, smartphones, and notebooks. These non-neural vehicles of representation are the reason that extended cognition is also known as vehicle externalism. When Schulz (unsurprisingly) concludes that his representational approach is consistent with extended cognition, he has done nothing to address the embodied theorist's claim that evolution may have selected for extra-neural and non-representational mechanisms of behavior determination.
There is much to recommend this book. Schulz's approach to philosophy is a refreshing one: he builds on the strengths of existing accounts instead of demolishing them, and he shows how his conclusions support rather than refute the claims of other researchers. Schulz distances himself from the controversial and narrow confines of the Evolutionary Psychology program, focusing instead on the evidential value of genuinely interdisciplinary work. In these respects, his book sets an admirable standard. The concept of cognitive efficiency has previously received little philosophical interest, and it is to be hoped that Schulz's book stimulates new work in this area. However, Schulz's strategy of focusing on the efficiency differences between representational and non-representational mechanisms may not be the optimal approach. Representations alone are neither efficient nor inefficient: much depends on whether information is encoded symbolically or non-symbolically, for example, whether processing rules are explicitly represented, and how encapsulated cognitive processes are. Schulz has little to say on matters of cognitive architecture, other than to claim that his own arguments concerning cognitive efficiency are neutral with respect to modular and non-modular architectures. This seems unlikely: the features of cognition that contribute to efficiency (e.g. speed, effort, redundancy) are precisely the kinds of features that differ across architectures. There are limits to how much we can expect to learn about cognitive efficiency from considering representations in isolation from the cognitive processes operating over them, and the cognitive architectures in which they are embedded.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
This review benefited from discussions with Bianca Andrade, Jordan Bell, Ellyn Daly, Lara Krisst, Shawn Miller, Khang That Vin Ton, and Danielle Williams.
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