Is there a property of being Socrates? If so, what is it like and what distinguishes it from properties like being blue or being oblong? This concise book by Matthew Davidson is a concerted effort to get to the bottom of the metaphysics of haecceities—the controversial category of properties like being Socrates and being identical with Donald Trump.
The central thesis of About Haecceity is constituentist realism. On this view, haecceities exist and have as their constituents the entities that exemplify them. So, for example, being Socrates has Socrates as a constituent, while being red and being round have no objects as constituents. On Davidson’s preferred version of constituentist realism, haecceities belong to a sui generis category of abstract entity, each of which has an individual as a constituent. Davidson argues that constituentism comes with a variety of benefits. It permits a plausible analysis of the intuitive distinction drawn above between qualitative properties like being blue and non-qualitative ones like being Socrates (or, for Davidson, qualitative and quidditative properties). It is also alleged to provide a plausible treatment of claims sometimes made regarding our capacity to “grasp” the haecceities of individuals.
The structure of the book is agreeably straightforward. An introductory chapter surveys—in terms readily digestible to analytic metaphysicians—some historical precursors to recent discussions about haecceity. Of particular value is an overview of some unduly neglected yet comparatively recent contributions to these debates from Roderick Chisholm, Alvin Plantinga, Robert Adams, and Gary Rosenkrantz. The centerpiece of the book is the second chapter, which articulates a taxonomy of views about haecceities. There, Davidson mounts a case against partist versions of realism, which hold haecceities to be parts of individuals. He further argues that we ought to prefer his constituentism to the next-best competitor, primitivism, which takes haecceities to be primitive entities without individuals as constituents. Chapter Three evaluates the more basic question of whether or not haecceities exist. In this regard, Davidson’s assessment is distinctive. He finds no support for realism about haecceities in the thought experiments attributable to Max Black or related arguments developed by Adams and others regarding identity and distinctness. Instead, Davidson takes the case for haecceities to rest upon semantic considerations—roughly, the ease with which certain semantic frameworks can be developed once haecceities are posited. (Would-be nominalists will find no extended discussion of views that reject the existence of properties altogether and in doing so rule out the existence of haecceities.)
The remaining chapters explore various concerns about haecceities, often with an eye toward the implications of constituentism. Chapter Four defends quidditative constituentism, according to which the qualitative or quidditative status of properties depends upon whether they have individuals as constituents. Chapter Five defends the existence of unexemplified haecceities on semantic grounds and with noteworthy consequences. On Davidson’s preferred view, it turns out that, even in worlds where Socrates doesn’t exist, the property being Socrates might nevertheless exist. This constellation of views—that Socrates does not exist, that being Socrates does, and that being Socrates still has Socrates as a constituent—pushes Davidson toward a view regularly referenced in the book: independence actualism. According to independence actualism, some objects exemplify properties and stand in relations despite not existing. (In this case, Socrates has the property being a constituent of being Socrates despite there being no such thing as Socrates.) Chapter Six touches upon certain issues regarding the epistemology of haecceities and in what sense, if any, we might grasp haecceities of individuals. A discussion of presentism and the prospects of using haecceities to address various objections to this view of time is undertaken in Chapter Seven.
About Haecceity makes clear the varied ties between haecceities and several on-going debates in ontology. Throughout, Davidson’s clarity, coupled with his running defense of sui generis constituentism, make for an organized inquiry into what could otherwise prove to be unwieldy terrain. At some junctures, the scope of the book leaves the reader eager for a more sustained pursuit of possible options, but Davidson is clear-eyed about when the assessment of an argument or view would require settling extant ontological controversies. In any case, there are arguments aplenty here, and it is a virtue of the book that readers will have a relatively sharp sense of where they part company from Davidson.
Ultimately, the constituentist view emerges as the most well-developed view of haecceities presently found in the literature. At the same time, the case mounted in its favor raises a few methodological points of interest, which I discuss in what follows.
According to partist views which compete with Davidson’s preferred constituentism, haecceities are mereological proper parts of either bundles of properties, thick particulars, or hylomorphic compounds. Davidson’s case against partism is motivated, in part, by his general skepticism about whether qualities (or at least tropes or hylomorphic forms) are parts of things. Of his opposition to partism, Davidson says
[It] stems from a belief that objects don’t have things like tropes or substantial forms as parts. I don’t think there is any reason to include such things in one’s ontology; there is nothing that substantial forms or tropes do for one metaphysically that one can’t already do with objects, properties, and abstract states of affairs. Furthermore, objects, properties, and states of affairs—for me at least—are less metaphysically suspect than abstract particular tropes or form-matter ontologies. Thus, I reject that objects have things like tropes or forms as parts. (32)
Davidson adds that, when asked to name parts of Socrates, “At no point in my list of parts of Socrates have I included things like tropes or substantial forms” (32). Davidson’s case against partism therefore rests upon two kinds of argumentative maneuver: a broad evaluation of theoretical costs and benefits, and an appeal to what seems like ordinary intuitions about parthood.
I agree with Davidson that, by ordinary standards, it is peculiar to cite redness as a part of an apple or humanity as part of Socrates. But I’m not sure how much this should matter in light of certain other arguments Davidson offers in the book. Consider the case Davidson gives for the coherence of the central tenet of constituentism according to which haecceities have individuals as constituents. In defense of this thesis, Davidson says, “If we are able to understand a concrete object being a constituent of a singular proposition, we should be able to understand a concrete object being a constituent of an haecceity. . . .As the notion of a singular proposition is coherent, I submit the notion of an haecceity with a concrete constituent also is coherent” (39).
I’m doubtful that the passenger on the Clapham Omnibus would happily accede to the relevant claims about propositional constituency that Davidson alludes to here. In fact I’d wager that they would view them with suspicion. But, if ordinary intuitions matter in the case against partists, they should matter in the case against constituentists. And, similarly, if we can support constituentism by appeal to the judgments of a studiously informed metaphysician who is well acquainted with singular propositions, we should be able to appeal to the same judgments in defending the merits of partism—and, of course, many metaphysicians part ways with Davidson in holding hylomorphism to be perfectly intuitive. For these reasons, I was uncertain how the balance of intuitive evidence was to be understood across certain arguments in the book, especially for those inclined to contrast “folk” intuitions from the judgments of plausibility and coherence made by metaphysicians.
Davidson’s assessment of the case for haecceities raises additional questions about the role and weight of deductive arguments as compared to evaluations of theoretical virtue and vice in metaphysics. Early on in the book, in his assessment of hylomorphist views, Davidson presents his case against them on two grounds: “The first is that I never feel like I have a firm grasp on what forms, or forms over and above matter, are. . . . A second reason is related to the first: I don’t think that form matter ontologies do any explanatory work that ordinary object-property ontologies can’t do” (33). These are familiar sorts of complaints in contemporary metaphysical debates. Davidson’s former argument identifies an allegedly vicious degree of unclarity in hylomorphism, and the latter cites an allegedly vicious failure of parsimony in hylomorphism’s proffered explanations. A similar kind of argument was also quoted above as part of Davidson’s case against partism.
I am sympathetic to metaphysics that involves a significant role for cost-benefit analysis, but if such a methodology is adopted, it means that our standards for assessing certain arguments often become noticeably murkier. This bears significantly on Davidson’s evaluation of the family of arguments that Adams and others have advanced in support of realism about haecceities. Roughly speaking, this family of arguments revolves around thought experiments concerning qualitatively indiscernible spheres, nearly qualitatively indiscernible spheres, and various temporal and modal analogues thereof. For example, suppose we admit, not just the possibility of there being two qualitatively indiscernible spheres, but that there are additional distinct possibilities regarding which of the two is, say, spontaneously destroyed. This sort of case for haecceities asserts that the existence of the haecceities of the spheres in question is needed to account for the distinctness of these possibilities.
Davidson provides an extensive discussion of these thought experiments—one that interprets and assesses them exclusively as deductive arguments, and he ultimately concludes that the premises of these various arguments fail to entail the truth of their putative conclusion or fall prey to allegations of question-begging. In evaluating these arguments, Davidson says, “All of them have been seen to fail. Many of them fail in the same sort of way, viz., that they fail to rule out a view on which individuation is truly brute” (60).
I agree with Davidson about the shortcomings of these arguments when interpreted and evaluated as deductive demonstrations of the existence of haecceities—ontological commitment to haecceities, like most any other ontological commitment, remains resistible in principle. But if our aim is to discern what metaphysical theories best explain our target phenomena (e.g., the just-noted scenarios regarding spheres or perhaps our best physical theories), a natural way to evaluate Adams’s arguments is by asking whether realism about haecceities provides the best explanation of the metaphysical scenarios. Put another way: I worry that Davidson asks too much of the arguments Adams and others offer for haecceities. The more charitable reading of these arguments as abductive in structure would also be in line with Davidson’s own manner of defending metaphysical theses seen just above. To be sure, the holistic evaluation of theories is a complicated and often frustratingly open-ended matter, but the weight of this family of arguments seems more aptly measured by attending to explanatory virtues than by scrutinizing their irresistibility as demonstrations. Moreover, when Davidson cites the role of haecceities within his preferred semantic theories, it is difficult not to ask whether these semantic theories are themselves supported via general theoretical virtues rather than by irresistible deductive arguments. For these reasons, I believe open questions still remain about why, if at all, we should be realists about haecceities.
Davidson’s case for constituentism involves several interesting wrinkles. Among them, he argues that constituentism allows realists about haecceities to avoid metaphysically necessary connections between distinct existences. Davidson says the following:
Consider then Socrates and his haecceity, being Socrates. If primitivism about haecceities is correct, then we have a necessary connection between two distinct contingent existences: Necessarily, Socrates exists only if being Socrates does. . . .Suppose, however, that constituentism is correct. Then, Socrates is part of his haecceity, being Socrates. As a result, we don’t really have a necessary connection between distinct objects. (37)
This line of argument raises questions about the stricture against necessary connections, which has been influentially defended by David Lewis. (Lewis receives surprisingly little attention throughout the book—perhaps most notably, his deflationary treatment of haecceities as either singletons or sets of counterparts is undiscussed.) One worry raised by Lewis about the interaction of non-mereological composition with necessary connections looms especially large. Abbreviating Lewis’ arguments significantly: if composition is mereological, then composites are nothing over and above their parts, so the relation of parts to a whole is not a necessary connection between distinct existences. If, however, composition is non-mereological, then the relationship between the parts and what they compose would be an objectionable necessary connection since the whole would be, not merely its parts, but its parts plus something else (e.g., a certain kind of structure).
For Lewis, this worry is most familiar in the form of states of affairs. Consider the state of affairs of a being F. This state of affairs isn’t merely the sum of a and F—after all, a might exist even when only b is an F. So, this complex entity would seem to have a and F as constituents but in a non-mereological manner. If we assume that the existence of a being F necessitates the existence of both a and F, this kind of necessary connection is worrisome, says Lewis, because the state of affairs is something distinct from or “over and above” its constituents. On this front, Lewis suggestively says of necessary connections and non-mereological composition that “Perhaps these two mysteries are the same” (Lewis 2003:37).
Non-mereological composition is essential to constituentist realism: Socrates’ haecceity is not merely the sum of Socrates and a specific abstract entity. Rather, the haecceity of Socrates must be built out of Socrates and an abstract entity in the right way. Although Davidson draws an analogy between the constituency relation of haecceities and individuals to singular propositions and their constituent semantic values, more could usefully be said about the specific nature of this non-mereological composition. But, if the constituentist’s haecceities are like singular propositions, then, since the latter are standardly taken to be built up non-mereologically, the former will similarly involve necessary connections that Lewis and others seek to do without. For this reason, the constituency relationship essential to constituentism is in tension with the motivation of avoiding necessary connections.
The above worry might be mitigated by noting that some Humeans—including Lewis himself, at times—are principally concerned with individuals being modally “free” from one another and not individuals and properties (or properties and properties). In Davidson’s argument for constituentism, the specified modal concern involves Socrates and the property being Socrates. (He refers to individuals and properties as “objects.”) But, if our aim is to do away with all necessary connections involving properties, there seems to be little hope of achieving this on the present view. While, according to independence actualism, being Socrates can exist even in worlds where Socrates does not exist, being Socrates will nevertheless necessarily instantiate the property having Socrates as a constituent—a property that singular propositions and other non-mereological complexes can instantiate too. Perhaps some Humeans would be comfortable with such a commitment since it relates properties rather than individuals, but, again, it does seem to traffic in the kind of “mysteries” that Lewis and others find concerning. In light of this tension between constituentism and Humeanism, it seems that the case for constituentism will have to rest on other considerations.
The cumulative case Davidson makes for constituentism also points us toward the prospective analysis of qualitative versus quidditative properties. One way to shore up this line of argument is to make clear precisely why this distinction is worth analyzing—e.g., what role the distinction plays in our broader theorizing or, more controversially, as part of an inviolable body of ordinary intuitions.
My hunch is that the broadest and most regular use of this distinction is in spelling out notions like qualitative indiscernibility and related ones like duplication. If that’s correct, certain challenges await Davidson’s constituentism. Here’s one: suppose you believe that time can pass without qualitative change and, with fans of certain conceptions of the moving spotlight theory of temporal passage, that there is a fundamental property of being present that “shines” over reality. I take it that the best way to understand this view is as one on which a fundamental tense property of being present is non-qualitative. But such a property surely doesn’t seem to have constituents.
Here’s another curious case related to the qualitative distinction: according to some, species properties like being a tiger are non-qualitative and so different from qualitative properties like being tiger-like and are much more akin to haecceities. If that view is correct, does being a tiger have each and every tiger as a constituent, or only past and present tigers, or what?
A final curiosity about the qualitative distinction is specific to constituentism: you might think that the actual world has a haecceity, but, if the world consists of all that there is, then, for the world to have a haecceity, it would need to be a constituent of that haecceity. But, it’s not clear how the world can be all that there is as well as a part of something else upon pain of increasingly strange forms of constituency. So what should we make of the limits of haecceity distribution? Do worlds, times, or regions possess them, too? (This sort of problem will be familiar to proponents of singular propositions who face a parallel one.)
There may be constituentist stories to tell about such properties, but, regardless of these and other curious cases, About Haecceity will prove a useful book for metaphysicians interested in questions about the metaphysics of identity.
REFERENCE
Lewis, David. 2003. "Things Qua Truthmakers" in Lillehammer, H. and G. Rodriguez-Pereyra (eds.), 2003, Real Metaphysics: Essays in honor of D. H. Mellor, London: Routledge, 25–38.