Much has been written regarding the roster of thinkers who contributed to Theodor Adorno’s distinctive thought, most notably Marx, Hegel, Benjamin, Kant, Weber, Freud and Nietzsche. In Adorno’s Gamble: Harnessing German Ideology, Mikko Immanen is keen to make clear that he in no way intends to dispute these more conventional intellectual histories of Adorno’s thought (6, 154-155). Instead, his goal is to add to this list two early 20th-century radical right-wing critics of Western reason and civilisation: Ludwig Klages and Oswald Spengler. His contention is not that Adorno’s engagement with these two figures is “the key to Adorno’s thought” but instead one of many keys, “yet one that has remained too far from the lock for too long” (21). According to Immanen, the vital role of these two controversial figures in Adorno’s intellectual development has been, for the most part, neglected, and when this has not been the case, their role has typically been misconstrued.
As Immanen notes, from as early as ‘The Actuality of Philosophy’, his inaugural lecture in 1931, to his last major work published in his lifetime, Negative Dialectics, Adorno’s thought can appear to be a “striking continuum”. Yet, as he points out, even for a thinker as consistent throughout his philosophical career as Adorno, there must be some point at which he found his own philosophical voice (22-23), a point at which, in Adorno’s own words, he “came to trust his own mental impulses” (2007, xx) and set himself the task of using “the strength of the subject to break through the fallacy of constitutive subjectivity” (22). According to Immanen, this task first began to find its direction in part through his serious and underappreciated engagement with the anti-Enlightenment works of Spengler and Klages.
Immanen is careful throughout to avoid discussing Adorno’s relationship to the thought of Klages and Spengler as one of mere ‘influence’, explicitly problematising this term as implying little more than “passively adopting their ideas” (18). Rather, Adorno was always “an active reader of the theories of Spengler and Klages” (18-19), critically reappropriating or ‘harnessing’ the insights of these purveyors of ‘German ideology’ in order to avoid leaving “consideration of the destructive side of progress to its enemies” (Adorno & Horkheimer, 2002, xvi; Immanen, 2025, 19). Chiefly, their insights regarding the historical path of reason and the integrity of liberal democracy, insights that Adorno repurposed and mobilised against both complacent views regarding the inevitability of ‘progress’ but also against the reactionary and anti-rational elements in Spengler’s and Klages’ own thought.
Adorno’s Gamble is split into three chapters. The first is dedicated to Klages and argues that the critique of ‘identity thinking’ or ‘constitutive subjectivity’ (Immanen sometimes uses these interchangeably) undertaken in Negative Dialectics finds its origin in Adorno’s aborted ‘Klages Project’ of the 1930s, in which he sought to respond to Klages’ critique of Western ‘logocentrism’ in Spirit as Adversary of the Soul. Chapter 2 is focused on Spengler and argues that the common attribution of Adorno’s sensitivity regarding the fragility of democracy to Marx and Freud overlooks the importance of Spengler’s analysis of ‘Caesarism’ in the second volume of Decline of the West, especially with respect to Adorno’s works on the ‘culture industry’ and authoritarianism. The third chapter is equally dedicated to Klages and Spengler and argues that alongside the standardly attributed influences on Dialectic of Enlightenment, heed should also be taken of Adorno’s struggles with Spengler and Klages. This is followed by a short but rather interesting epigraph in which Immanen assesses ‘Adorno’s Gamble’, including the possible virtues it has over his Frankfurt School heirs.
Immanen’s book is clearly written and tightly structured, with its central claims and argumentative links helpfully signposted and returned to throughout. Despite its clarity, the central focus and relatively short length means that Adornian ideas can sometimes be taken for granted, rather than discussed at length, and so this book would likely be of most interest to readers who already have some familiarity with some of Adorno’s key ideas and works. However, Immanen does provide very helpful introductions to both Spengler and Klages, which is especially welcome in the case of Klages, who, as he notes, is likely the more obscure figure of the two today (8).
That said, even readers who are familiar with the ideas of both Adorno and Klages are still likely to be less familiar with Adorno’s engagement with Klages than with Spengler. This is because Adorno published at least two articles on Spengler, as well as a review of Spengler’s Man and Technics. By contrast, despite harbouring aims to the contrary that are a central point of Immanen’s analysis, Adorno produced no work dedicated to Klages. Instead, references to Klages in Adorno’s published work tend to be brief and often highly critical or dismissive (15, 17, 29-30, 41). Despite the mostly critical published remarks, what Adorno saw in Klages and Spengler were “intellectual outsiders” who “could occasionally better see through the prejudices of their time than their more mainstream contemporaries” (15).
For the Klages connection, Immanen relies on correspondence and argumentation to establish the claim that Klages was a key figure in Adorno’s early intellectual development. Given that Klages is the lesser-known figure and that there is less extant work by Adorno dedicated to him, the parts focused on Klages are potentially the most novel, though also harbour more difficulties for Immanen’s approach. As such, I will primarily focus on Immanen’s treatment of Adorno’s engagement with Klages.
In Chapter 1, Immanen claims that it was Adorno’s engagement with Klages that spurred key elements of what would go on to become the project of Negative Dialectics already in the early 1930s. His argument for this has its strongest basis in two pieces of evidence drawn from Adorno’s correspondence with other thinkers.
The first involves Adorno’s response to criticisms of his early book on Kierkegaard made by Siegfried Kracauer, who complained to him that the concept of ‘the mythical’ presented there was too undifferentiated. In reply, Adorno agreed with Kracauer’s criticism and made clear that he intended to formulate a more robust account of ‘myth’ (42-43). This account eventually found its most enduring expression a decade later in Dialectic of Enlightenment (123), where it could be decisively differentiated from Klages’ usage (141-143).
The second is that Adorno volunteered in 1932 to take up Horkheimer’s request for a review of Klages’ Spirit as Adversary of the Soul for the Zeitschrift für Sozialforschung. Adorno told Kracauer that he had taken on this project on Klages to make good on his intention to think through the concept of ‘the mythical’ (19). However, his ambitions for this project, which Immanen refers to as the ‘Klages Project’, quickly ballooned beyond the scope of a mere book review (41-43). The project was eventually abandoned around 1936 when Adorno complained to Horkheimer that he could not give it the time it required and recommended that his friend, Alfred Sohn-Rethel, would be well-placed to take up the project in his stead (46), a prospect which Horkheimer refused (66-68).
Immanen makes a convincing case using limited evidence that Adorno’s readiness to agree with Kracauer’s view that a better account of ‘myth’ was needed was tied to his preoccupations with Klages’ work, in particular, to distinguish his own understanding from Klages’ problematic appeal to ‘myth’ as a kind of mystical, prelapsarian antidote to the evils of Western ‘logocentrism’. This argument is made even more convincing in one of the most interesting parts of the third chapter of Adorno’s Gamble, in which Immanen draws on arguments implicitly made against Klages in ‘Excursus I’ of Dialectic of Enlightenment, contrasting the much more refined and dialectical account of ‘myth’ that Adorno had developed by the early 1940s with Klages’ simplistic binary between ‘reason’ and ‘myth’.
However, I was occasionally less convinced of Immanen’s willingness to emphasise the role of Klages’ works on Adorno’s endeavours. At one point, Immanen reproduces a passage from Klages that includes the phrase ‘disenchantment of the world’, a phrase also used on the opening page of Dialectic of Enlightenment (Adorno and Horkheimer, 2002, 1). Immanen argues that the use of this phrase by Klages troubles the generally accepted attribution to Weber, who otherwise gets only one explicit reference in that entire book (122). Klages’ usage of the phrase occurs not in Spirit as Adversary of the Soul but in his 1922 work Of Cosmogonic Eros. Adorno’s familiarity with that earlier work seems uncertain, but Immanen reasons it “likely” that Adorno had read it, which seems to hinge on the fact that Kracauer (Adorno’s erstwhile mentor) had overseen publication of parts of it in the Frankfurter Zeitung in 1922 (38). Perhaps, but according to Müller-Doohm (2005), we do know that in 1921 Adorno studied the recent works of Weber (69), which would presumably include ‘Science as a Vocation’, in which the phrase “disenchantment of the world” most famously appears (Weber, 2009, 155).
A further plank of Immanen’s argument in the first chapter is that the ‘Klages Project’ was carried on by other means and channelled into the ‘Oxford manuscript’ on Husserl, produced in the mid-1930s but published much later in the 1950s with numerous additions and revisions as Against Epistemology: A Metacritique (47-53). Immanen notes that Klages is never mentioned by name in the ‘Oxford Manuscript’ but argues that his enduring impression on Adorno can be read between the lines (48). He provides some interesting points of comparison in support, drawn from statements taken from the work on Husserl that seem to prefigure some of Adorno’s better-known insights regarding the domination of nature and which Immanen compares to Klages’ account of Western ‘logocentrism’ (50).
Again, this is possible, but given that, as Immanen notes, there seem to be no extant manuscripts, notes or otherwise relating to the ‘Klages Project’ beyond references in Adorno’s correspondence (32), this argument ends up feeling somewhat speculative. While correspondence does seem to make it clear that Adorno still harboured ambitions to produce a work on Klages into the mid-1930s, to what extent these were anything more substantial than ambitions is difficult to ascertain. Additionally, some of the stronger comparisons to Klages that Immanen makes refer to statements that seem to have been added by Adorno to the later published version of Against Epistemology: A Metacritique, and so, well after Dialectic of Enlightenment and the end of the ‘Klages Project’, something that Immanen himself points out (50-51).
Regardless, Immanen’s arguments are always engaging and at least plausible. As such, Adorno’s Gamble gives readers of Adorno much to consider regarding his preoccupation with these two figures of Zivilisationskritik during a crucial period of his intellectual development. In my view, Immanen has produced a hugely interesting and welcome intervention into Adorno scholarship, which also adds usefully to a growing body of work set against Habermas’ longstanding and deeply influential judgements on Adorno’s work, which have for too long coloured its reception. In light of the recent rise of ethnonationalisms and authoritarianism, Immanen states at the outset that “Habermas’ verdict on Adorno’s obsolescence is itself outdated”, instead better applying to Habermas’ comparatively optimistic view of the path of progress and endurance of liberal democracies, which today appear increasingly fragile (3-6).
Adorno rejected Spengler’s pseudorationalist concept of ‘cultural morphology’ (75), his inverted philosophy of history that merely replaced one fatal myth (progress) with another (decline) (76) and his advocacy, not just prophecy, of the destruction of Enlightenment emancipatory ideals (15; 77). Yet, according to Immanen, it was his engagement with the anti-democratic Spengler that pushed Adorno to criticise his contemporaries’ naïve complacency about the path of progress and liberal democracy. Adorno knew, especially after Auschwitz, that the historical force behind Spengler’s work was more powerful than optimistic attempts made by academic philosophers to rationally demolish his arguments (72-73). Immanen makes a timely case for revisiting Adorno’s concerned engagement with a figure who once made the uncomfortable prediction that the wearing-away of democratic ideals would likely come, “not from refutation, but from boredom” (Spengler, quoted on 169).
REFERENCES
Adorno, T. W. (2007) Negative Dialectics. Translated by Ashton, E. B. New York: Continuum Press.
Adorno, T. W. & Horkheimer, M. (2002) Dialectic of Enlightenment: Philosophical Fragments. Edited by Noerr, G. S. Translated by Jephcott, E. Stanford: Stanford University Press.
Müller-Doohm, S. (2005) Adorno: A Biography. Translated by Livingstone, R. Cambridge: Polity Press.
Weber, M. (2009) From Max Weber: Essays in Sociology. Edited and translated by Gerth, H. H. and Wright Mills, C. London: Routledge.