In African philosophy: Emancipation and practice, Pascah Mungwini offers some thoughtful insights into “the emancipative thrust in the practice of African philosophy” (2) against Africa’s background of social, political and economic injustices and oppression that were perpetrated by colonialism and neocolonialism. In this book, Mungwini shows serious concern with the intellectual marginalisation of Africa, which is not only evident through denial of epistemic agency but also hesitance by Africans to contribute to the production of traditionally and culturally rooted knowledge about Africa (see 72). Essentially this book is about how to confront epistemic injustice (see Fricker 2007 and Gatsheni-Ndlovu 2018) facing African thinkers in their quest for self-understanding within their different African traditional cultural contexts. Consider that the exclusion or denial of a people’s knowledge from meaning-making is a form of epistemic injustice. Throughout this book, Mungwini sees this epistemic injustice in the way African traditional cultural practices are derided as ethno-philosophy. While the book appeared as part of the ‘Bloomsbury Introductions to World Philosophies,’ for practicing philosophers, the content of this book is highly insightful, illuminating, and significant because of the way it critically engages with some of the most controversial issues and themes in African philosophy.
The oral tradition in African philosophy continues to be eclipsed by the growing body of literature on African philosophy that was illuminated in the mid-twentieth century. In introducing the book, Mungwini does an important critical review of this literature on African philosophy. He picks out important literature from across the continent that conveniently helps him not only to dispel impositions, prescriptivist, unanimist, and oppressive approaches that have traditionally characterised the story and practice of African philosophy on the continent, but also to show and strengthen the emancipative mission of African philosophy. Of course, this emancipative mission is based on the understanding that “philosophy must contribute towards the emancipation of Africa” (8). This is an important background as it sets the tone of the book by highlighting how post-colonial discourse on African philosophy is closely connected to the historical realities of Africa.
It must be emphasised that until recently, the story of African philosophy has been synonymous with unjustified denial, exclusion, controversy, and scepticism. Thus, within the first chapter, Mungwini carefully provides an excellent cartographic analysis of the discipline of African philosophy before exposing some of the debates, challenges, disagreements and controversies that have historically characterised and shaped the development and current trends in African philosophy, particularly the famous “critique of ethnophilosophy” that was sparked by Paulin J. Hountondji. While he strives to “lay out its [African philosophy’s] methodological and epistemological foundations as an enterprise” (17), Mungwini makes an important entry into African philosophy. He identifies the kind of self-scepticism and hesitancy to affirm self-identity that impedes the progress of African philosophy owing to the critique of ethnophilosophy, unlike the “multiplicity of views and divisions that have characterised Western philosophy as a tradition” (14; see also, 18). Essentially, Mungwini alerts the reader to some of the consequences of the unintended exclusionary effects which the traditional critique of ethno-philosophy has had on African philosophical traditions, notwithstanding its encouragement of critical discourse on African philosophy through rejection of what Mungwini sees as unanimism and extraversion (24). Indeed, the critique of ethno-philosophy can be acknowledged for denying a collective philosophy that is always oriented towards satisfying the outside world, although, its putative implications on African philosophy is something that cannot be taken for granted, and Mungwini should be credited for his cautionary approach to it.
Certainly, the critique of ethnophilosophy has far-reaching moral implications for questions on identity, self-understanding, and coloniality in African philosophy. In the second chapter, Mungwini essentially addresses the questions of identity and self-understanding as typically moral questions and proffers some decolonial strategies for responding to the fear of articulating African ethno-philosophy. He does so by looking at some of the problems such as failure to self-identify and to self-understand that are caused by coloniality and the analytic model of the West. These problems lead to what he sees as the hesitancy to delve into some of the philosophically under-explored African oral traditional cultural practices and resources, which are all important in the understanding of the self, one’s history and intellectual heritage. He thus sees the “hermeneutical studies into the cultures and lived realities of the African people [as] not only desirable. . .but one productive approach in the reconstruction of African philosophy” (51). This can ultimately be achieved through the use of African indigenous languages.
The dominant Eurocentric tradition in academic philosophy has essentially rendered intercultural experience in philosophy impossible. In the third chapter, Mungwini positions dialogue not only as corrective to the epistemic hegemony, and “exclusivist and narrow” (78) tradition in Western thinking, but also a normative solution to the exclusion and injustice facing African philosophy. He positions philosophy to the realities of life and sees African philosophy as capable of dialoguing with, and contributing to other world philosophies in the search for knowledge, wisdom, and ultimate solutions to the problems that humanity faces. Mungwini provides penetrating reasons why dialogue deepens and widens human perspectives and mutual understanding, all of which are necessary conditions for intercultural philosophy, where “no single tradition of thought or philosophy can pronounce or consider itself as the only true philosophy for all humanity” (90) in a world characterised by plurality of perspectives despite individual philosophical experiences all of which cannot be undermined.
In Africa, the end of colonial rule was not synonymous with epistemic liberation, hence “decolonisation, transformation and Africanisation have gained traction as possible ways to fight off and overturn the conquest of African people’s epistemologies” (Masaka, 2022: 1). It is for this reason that in the fourth chapter, Mungwini revisits what he sees as the unfinished process of decolonisation on the epistemic front in Africa as an ethical imperative and emphasises the importance of African epistemic agency in that process which effectively ought to demarginalise Africa and put it at the centre of its own history. The process of recentering Africa at the epistemic front is seen as capable of helping Africa to make use of its own knowledge in solving its own problems, to wean itself from epistemic marginalisation and ideologies of universalism “which have sought to trivialise the contribution of other peoples to knowledge and civilisation” (112), and ultimately to feed into epistemologies of the global South and other world philosophies. In the end, Mungwini acknowledges the current difficulties facing the task of decolonisation of knowledge in African institutions, which he sees as resembling the process of building a ship that one is already onboard. Notwithstanding, he sees the task of decolonisation of African knowledge as more urgent than ever before because of growing voices against domination and marginalisation in Africa and in the African diaspora.
The quest to present certain hegemonic traditions as the universal approach in philosophy should be challenged. Indeed, a universal approach to philosophy should be able to accept the existence of different and diverse cultural and philosophical traditions. In the fifth and last chapter, Mungwini reminds the reader of the emerging reality of world philosophies and their promise for diversity and interculturality. While he sees potential in the idea and promise of philosophy as a universal practice, he cautions that different philosophical traditions ought to be taken as streams that “traverse different territories and lands” (141), as they show humanity’s reflective heritage in spite of one’s location. In the end, Mungwini brings in the African philosophy of ubuntu not only as a humanist political philosophy for African people’s quest for justice, dignity and respect, well-being, and humane existence, but also to show how different traditions and philosophies are capable of contributing to world philosophies and being drivers of change while they remain products of their context.
Throughout the book, Mungwini is very cautious about his choice of language as he carefully and insightfully deploys some controversial terms like 'self-understanding', 'decolonisation', 'coloniality', 'extraversion', etc. However, Mungwini sometimes uses the phrases 'philosophy in Africa' and 'African philosophy' interchangeably (4; 5; 42). Indeed, the former expression might be used to mean something broader than what African philosophy ought to be. For example, the practice of Western philosophy in Africa might be accommodated by this expression, and I do not think Mungwini would be comfortable with this. Again, Mungwini avers that “the period of the 1970s and early 1980s was undoubtedly one of the most important in the formative stages of African philosophy and in its expansion as a university course in Africa” (33, my emphasis). The first part of this proposition would make Mungwini’s quest for grounding African philosophy on African traditions an oxymoron because African philosophy has always been inherent in different African traditions, which essentially is his argument throughout the book. Of course, he is right that this is the period in which African philosophy begins to be formalised in the university curricula.
Overall, this book is a most engaging, thought-provoking, carefully argued, and exhaustively researched book on epistemic (in)justice issues in African philosophy. It will ultimately be required reading for not only African philosophers, but anyone interested in contemporary issues on African philosophy and world philosophies. Mungwini has managed to excellently articulate some of the compelling reasons for the need to not only self-understand, but also why it is important to gain insights and knowledge from African intellectual traditions. Certainly, this is the only way through which African thinkers can attain epistemic freedom as they critically and constructively analyse African traditional cultural and philosophical traditions (see also, Wiredu,1980: 1) so that African philosophy can co-exist with other world philosophies. I have no doubt that this book will put African philosophy on the map of world philosophies.
REFERENCES
Fricker, Miranda. 2007. Epistemic Injustice: Power and the Ethics of Knowing. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Masaka, Dennis. Ed. 2022. Knowledge Production and the Search for Epistemic Liberation in Africa. Cham: Springer Nature.
Mungwini, Pascah, 2022. African philosophy: Emancipation and practice. London: Bloomsbury Academic.
Gatsheni-Ndlovu, Sabelo. J. 2018. Epistemic Freedom in Africa: Deprovincialization and Decolonization. New York: Routledge.
Wiredu, Kwasi. 1980. Philosophy and an African culture. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.