In many ways, the antithesis of the familiar is not the unfamiliar. The unfamiliar can be made familiar: we can examine it, experiment with it, even put it to use. A fully developed science—or an omniscient God willing to share knowledge—will render all that is unfamiliar familiar. Its antithesis is something so incongruent and incommensurate that the very concepts, categories, and the language used to characterize the familiar fall short of describing it. Call it the alien. If you draw a Venn diagram of the familiar—and its complement, the unfamiliar—the alien extends outside the plane of the paper, possibly not even touching it.
How does one go about thinking about the alien? Alien Structure is a bold, trailblazing expedition into the territory of the alien. The book (perhaps fittingly!) begins with the story of an explorer of faraway planets who reports of an alien community which is scientifically and technologically as advanced as we are, but whose language is radically different from our own. The alien language does not have nouns, verbs, or adjectives—its words belong to altogether different linguistic categories and its sentences have a different grammatical structure. And the explorer—who managed to teach our language to the aliens—further reports that the aliens ‘found it incredible that reality could contain what is required for our sentences to be true’ (1). (It should be safe to assume that we would have a similar view about their sentences.)
Can there be such an alien language? Matti Eklund’s book asks. It also provides a one-word answer and a crisp two-word argument. Yes. Why not? ‘Wouldn’t it be a miracle if all possible languages were found among what we find familiar?’ (74). But the book raises a further question—its main concern, in my opinion—and answers that too in the positive. Assuming that the structure of reality is somehow mirrored in the structure of language, can reality itself have an alien structure, one that is mirrored in the structure of an alien language?
Why raise these questions? Chapter 2 draws the connections between language and the world structured in alien ways with some broader projects within philosophy, including Conceptual Engineering and an investigation into the nature and limits of representation. But there is also a lot to agree with when Eklund says that these questions are, above all, of intrinsic interest, ‘the sorts of general, fundamental questions we philosophers thrive on’ (28). Chapter 3 lays down the terminology deployed in the later chapters—the different ways of defining the categories ‘object’ and ‘property’. Assuming that a satisfactory characterization of the notions ‘singular term’ and ‘predicate’ are available (e.g., in terms of their syntactic roles within a sentence), ‘Fregean objects’ are defined as the class of entities that are the worldly correlates of singular terms (and singular terms only) and ‘Russellian objects’ as the class of entities that are the worldly correlates either of singular terms or predicates.
The biggest risk for the reader is missing the notion of ‘alien language’ at issue. Neither the ambition behind the book’s central questions, nor the difficulty in answering them is obvious unless one attends to the relevant notion of ‘alien language’, a stipulation, but one chosen carefully to align the discussion with some hotly debated topics within contemporary metaphysics. So, it is useful to consider some differences which according to the book do not make a language alien. One may call a language ‘alien’ because its words express concepts different from those expressed by familiar languages. One may wonder if such mutually untranslatable languages exist. But this is an easy question. (Understood thus, even some natural languages may be alien with respect to each other.) But this is not what Eklund has in mind.
Alternatively, one may call a language ‘alien’ because its sentences have a grammatical structure different from that of familiar languages. Let’s say that syntactic theory discovers the ultimate grammatical constituents and structure of the sentences of familiar languages, say, English or languages similar to English. On this view, an alien language will be one whose sentences have constituents or structure that are different from those of English. Understood thus, several natural languages unfamiliar to speakers of languages belonging to the world’s major language families would seem alien because their syntactic structure is different from familiar ‘western’ languages.
Consider, for instance, that there are languages which purportedly lack a noun/verb distinction and others which even lack grammatical predicates (Chapter 8 discusses some such languages). Further, several philosophers have proposed languages that differ from English in interesting ways. Consider, for instance, the language proposed by Peter Sullivan—a ‘flat language’, as the book puts it—which consists of expressions (say, ‘α’, ‘β’, ‘γ’) of a single type and which can be combined via a single mode of composition, resulting in sentences like ‘αβγ’, or Wilfrid Sellar’s Jumblese which consists of iconographic representations of objects, properties, and relations, or ‘Staintonian’ languages in which a single word (e.g., ‘milk’) suffices to stand for an entire sentence, or ‘feature placing’ languages that lack a singular term. The world would seem to be brimming with alien languages.
Such languages, Eklund suggests, would still not be alien. Chapter 4 is home to the ‘disguise objection’, which aims to establish that what may on the surface seem like a very different language may be just something familiar in disguise. Essentially, the argument is that a language is not deserving of the title ‘alien’ if its sentences may be paraphrased using the sentences of a familiar language. And the sentences of the languages considered above—insofar as they are truth-apt or meaningful—may be paraphrased using a sentence of a familiar language. For instance, the English sentence ‘α, β, and γ stand in relation R to each other’ may paraphrase the sentence ‘αβγ’ of a flat language and paraphrases for ‘sentences’ of a Staintonian language may also be available in regular English (‘bring me some milk’).
Eklund rejects the disguise argument but agrees with its conclusion—syntactic differences of the kind outlined above do not suffice to make a language ‘alien’. An alien language is a structurally different system of representation. The structural differences are located at the semantic level, such that alien languages ‘are semantically different from familiar languages in a broadly structural way’. A natural way to understand this proposal is: the sentences of an alien language express structured propositions that are structured differently than those expressed by sentences of familiar languages. (This can be problematic because as the book also points out (19–20), a ‘proposition’ could stand for any of several different things e.g., a set of possible worlds. But I will occasionally resort to this way of speaking, as the book does, and use ‘representation’, ‘content’, and ‘proposition interchangeably’.)
Thus construed, one straightforward way for a language to be alien is for it to have new categories of expressions—and new modes of composition for those categories—that can represent aspects of the world, which expressions of a familiar language cannot. Another way for a language to be alien is by virtue of its expressions picking out objects of the world in ways that expressions of familiar languages cannot (105–111). For instance, the singular terms of an alien language may not refer to entities of the world but refer*—where reference* is a word-world relation distinct from reference—and consequently represent aspects of the world that cannot be represented by singular terms of familiar languages (which cannot refer*, but only refer).
What are such alien languages like? The book provides some toy examples of alien languages. One way to construct a somewhat alien language is by using the ‘false theory strategy’ (Chapter 5). False theories of (say) notions like ‘object’ and ‘reference’ may be true of some language, and sentences in those languages may express alien propositions. For instance, let’s say a ‘Fregean’ language is one in which it is impossible for the singular terms and predicates to co-refer (for simplicity, assume that both singular terms and predicates relate to the world in the same way, i.e., they refer). Grant also that familiar languages are not Fregean but ‘Russellian’, i.e., it is possible for the singular terms and predicates of familiar languages to co-refer. Nevertheless, some language may possibly be Fregean. If so, the counterparts of singular terms in the (familiar) Russellian and (possible) Fregean language represent entities belonging to distinct categories—‘Russellian objects’ and ‘Fregean objects’ respectively—and consequently, sentences of the two languages represent structurally distinct features of the world. The Fregean language is alien vis-à-vis the Russellian one.
Alien languages turn out to be quite useful for metaphysics. Those interested in counting how many entities or possible worlds there are will find the book useful, so will those who are interested in figuring out the structure of the world. (We won’t want to miss alien entities, or alien ways in which the world may be structured.) Chapters 6 and 7 are deployed full time to make the connections of alien structure with broader metaphysical issues explicit, but such issues make an appearance in almost every chapter. Chapter 10 generalizes. While the rest of the book assumes that the sentences of alien and familiar language are alike in that they both express truth apt propositions—albeit differently structured—this penultimate chapter discusses whether there can be languages which employ an alternative representational device at the level of sentences, sentences*, which express propositions* and are evaluated not in terms of truth but truth* (with the asterisk representing the alien counterpart of a familiar concept). The short Chapter 11 concludes by pointing towards some further directions in which an investigation into alien structure may develop.
One central message of the book is that systems of representation that seem to be very different from familiar languages may not be so different after all. For instance, the constituents and ‘syntax’ of maps are very different from natural languages. So, one might think that maps are an apt example of an alien language. But in line with arguments elsewhere in the book, Chapter 9 argues that the differences in maps lie at the level of syntax—i.e., at the level of the vehicle of content—and need not translate into differences at the level of content. Maps may express the same kind of propositions which are expressed by sentences of English (or some other familiar language).
This move can be a cause of some difficulty. Even if one is convinced that alien languages express alien contents or alien propositions, one might still wonder what it takes for there to be a difference at this level, and how one can spot such difference. ‘Map’, ‘sentence’, ‘syntax’, and ‘grammar’ are unlike ‘content’, ‘proposition’, and (even the more neutral) ‘representation’, which are all terms of art. Syntactic differences between languages (or between a language and a map) may be discovered and explained by an empirical science like linguistics, but to spot differences in content, we need some further assumptions about how content is individuated and how it relates to some vehicle of content, for it is the vehicle that we can perceive and examine.
This may seem like a side issue. For one, the question of whether there are alien contents or representations may be settled without settling how the contents are expressed. Secondly, although the notions ‘content’, ‘proposition’ (etc.) may be technical, one may think that they are nevertheless legitimate objects of study. The above worry, however, may be restated: the considerations for why flat language sentences like ‘αβγ’ may express familiar propositions suggests that the correspondence between syntax and content—whatever it is—is loose enough to allow for sentences that are syntactically very different to still express familiar propositions. But then, who is to say that the familiar languages like English may not express alien contents? We can imagine ‘aliens’ who produce the same sounds, utter the same sentences, and yet express alien propositions. (Closer to home, Herman Cappelen and Josh Dever have recently proposed that the contents associated with AI generated outputs may be alien in the relevant sense of ‘alien’.)
One response here could be that the book aims to study alien systems of representation and ‘whether the alien system of representation is linguistic or not is of less importance’ (18). Thus, English-speaking aliens—or more carefully, aliens speaking the overt form of English—do not tell against the aim. Yet, if we wish to know whether a given language is alien, we will need some way to connect its sentences with propositions. This will be a further project, and one which may require attending to the conventions and cognitive capacities of the language using community.
Alien Structure raises fresh questions about language, representation, and reality, and proposes new methodological tools to solve those problems. The analytical depth of the book is matched by the wide range of the topics it covers. It presents a systematic and unified treatment of its subject, alien structure, and identifies numerous connections with broader philosophical issues. Apart from the philosophy of language and linguistics, it is also very much a book in analytic metaphysics and connects directly with contemporary debates about fundamentality, perspicuous representation, ineffability, plenitude, and meta-ontology. One gets two books for the price of one.