Aristotle’s Practical Epistemology is Dhananjay Jagannathan’s interpretation of Aristotle’s theory of practical wisdom. It is of interest to scholars and students of Ancient Greek and Roman philosophy, to those interested in virtue epistemology, and to those interested in the epistemology and ethics of understanding.
In the vein of recent work on epistêmê as understanding (for example, Moravcsik 1979, Burnyeat 1980 and 1981, Annas 1981, Schwab 2016 and 2020, Moss 2020), Jagannathan’s thesis is that Aristotle’s concept of practical wisdom (phronêsis) should be interpreted as practical understanding. Jagannathan’s main strategy in the book is to argue from contrasts. By showing how practical wisdom is unlike a range of other epistemic states related to the human good (such as an intuitive sense of what to do; ethical experience (empeiria); theoretical wisdom (sophia); science (epistêmê); and so on), he concludes that “what is left is for practical wisdom to be a distinctly practical form of understanding” (121). Very roughly, phronêsis is a form of understanding in that it is a virtue—a developed intellectual perfection—by which we consistently hit on the truth in a certain domain; by which we grasp universal causes and principles explaining why things are so in that domain; and by which we have a thorough, comprehensive grasp of that domain. And it is a practical form of understanding in that it is used for deliberating about and choosing virtuous action.
The book stands out in several respects. Jagannathan helpfully brings Aristotle into uncommon conversations: for example, with Isocrates, Protagoras, Demosthenes, Hippocratic writers, Albert the Great, Aristophanes, and Xenophon, among others. His deployment of the concept of understanding captures important features of practical wisdom: that it grasps the truth, as well as “the why” behind those truths; that it integrates the general with the particular; that it grasps the connections among different practical values and goals; that it involves thinking successfully and getting things right across contexts and over a complete life; and, of course, that it is a major intellectual accomplishment, and therefore a virtue in Aristotelian terms.
Finally, Jagannathan positions his interpretation as a way of addressing long-standing debates in Aristotle’s ethics and epistemology. His main focus is the debate between “anti-intellectualists”, who think phronêsis does not include a grasp of universals, and “intellectualists”, who think phronêsis is an ethical science with universal principles. Jagannathan describes practical understanding as sharing key features with both anti-intellectualism and intellectualism about phronêsis, thus offering a third way out of the controversy.
Let me elaborate on these core features of the book in each of its chapters.
“Deflationism About Practical Knowledge” opens the book with some philosophical context for Jagannathan’s thesis that Aristotelian practical wisdom is practical understanding. Jagannathan situates the Nicomachean Ethics in response to a deflationary view of practical wisdom that he finds in Isocrates and Protagoras: the view that practical wisdom is not knowledge, but merely fallible, intuitive guesswork about what to do. Deflationism about phronêsis is motivated, Jagannathan argues, by two points.
First, practical matters are unclear and unstable. And second, practical matters are unclear and unstable because there are no objective facts about what is good or bad, only shifting conventions about what seems good or bad to a group of people. Jagannathan argues that Aristotle agrees with the deflationist about the first point, but that he denies the second point by invoking “for the most part” principles. “For the most part” principles are facts about mind-independent reality that can be known, and can give us practical knowledge of what to do by giving us explanations or “reasons why” certain things are to be done (or not), or are good (or bad), “for the most part”. Aristotelian practical knowledge, Jagannathan argues, is concerned with these “for the most part” principles and regularities.
“Ethical Experience in the Nicomachean Ethics” advances Jagannathan’s account of practical wisdom by exploring a key step in its development: gaining ethical experience (empeiria). Ethical experience, Jagannathan argues, is an ordinary form of practical knowledge, arising from good habituation, by which we know that certain things are true: that general facts about the human good are true; that specific things are to be done in specific circumstances (which involves “deliberative competence”); and that such-and-such techniques reliably helps us do those things. Such knowledge-that ensures significant success in performing the actions required by virtue.
Still, ethical experience does not rise to the level of practical wisdom or ethical understanding. Though it grasps generalities about the human good and how to apply those generalities in particular cases, ethical experience does not grasp the generalities as reasons why specific actions should be done. Thankfully, Jagannathan argues, ethical experience gives us the right starting point from which to inquire fruitfully and productively into the “reasons why”, and ultimately, to gain practical wisdom.
“The Nature of the Virtues of Thought” is Jagannathan’s account of what makes practical wisdom a virtue. He identifies three main features that make phronêsis a genuine virtue of thought: (1) phronêsis and its exercise are choiceworthy ends in themselves; (2) phronêsis achieves the goal of one of our intellectual capacities, namely, the goal of practical truth; and (3) phronêsis meets Aristotle’s “Independent Agency Requirement” on being a virtue. In support of (1), Jagannathan argues that practical wisdom is choiceworthy as an architectonic, prescriptive state that organizes our practical and technical activities in light of the human good. IIn support of (2), he argues that truth is the goal of all of our intellectual capacities as such, and that practical truth is the specific goal of our capacity for thinking about contingent matters. Practical wisdom is the state in which we are guaranteed to grasp practical truth, which is exemplified in virtuous choices that combine virtuous desires with excellent deliberative thinking. And in support of (3), Jagannathan argues that in order for practical wisdom to organize all our practical activities in light of the human good, it must be a state we ourselves have. Phronêsis could not do this merely by relying on virtuous others. In all three respects, therefore, practical wisdom is a genuine virtue of thought.
“Practical Understanding and Ethical Science” argues that practical wisdom is not an Aristotelian science (epistêmê). Jagannathan develops his account of Aristotelian phronêsis as a third option in the debate between “intellectualist” and “anti-intellectualist” interpretations of phronêsis—between those who say practical wisdom is a science, and those who deny that practical wisdom involves any universal and explanatory knowledge.
His focus in this chapter is to oppose intellectualist readings, which hold that phronêsis is some kind of ethical science. Jagannathan argues that science and practical wisdom differ in their characteristic outputs (demonstration vs. action); in whether they consist in a grasp of particulars (phronêsis does in part; epistêmê does not); in the precision with which they grasp universal principles and causes (less precisely for phronêsis, more precisely for epistêmê); and in the metaphysics of the principles and causes they grasp (“for the most part” for phronêsis; universal and necessary for epistêmê). Based on these differences, Jagannathan argues that no part of practical wisdom is scientific knowledge. In fact, he says, these differences show that “the character of understanding differs based on the domain”: practical wisdom and scientific knowledge are understanding of different domains—the domains of contingent matters, and matters with unchanging, necessary principles—but these differences in what they are understanding of also make them different qua understanding (104). As such, no part of ethical understanding is scientific and vice versa.
“Knowledge of Practical Universals” continues the argument from Chapter 4 by identifying what Jagannathan thinks “anti-intellectualists” have gotten wrong about practical wisdom: practical wisdom, on his view, includes universal and explanatory knowledge. This is so, he argues, because practical wisdom includes an understanding of the characteristic goals of virtuous action, i.e., of the actions prescribed by the virtues of character. Such goals are universal in that they are non-situation-specific (they are determinable); and they are explanatory principles in that they help the practically wise person to understand why such-and-such an action should be done in a specific situation, in a specific manner, and at a specific time. Jagannathan motivates his point with an interpretation of the virtue of particular justice and its characteristic goal. But of course, a well-lived, virtuous life pursues many practical goals. Jagannathan emphasizes that, in addition to the characteristic goals of all the character virtues, the practically wise person also understands the single, overarching goal of practical wisdom: eupraxia, acting well and successfully. However, he argues that eupraxia is not a separate goal that the practically wise person understands. Rather, the characteristic goals of virtuous action are understood by the practically wise person as different ways of achieving eupraxia. Understanding these goals, in turn, “grounds and orients” the excellent deliberation that leads a practically wise person to practical truth and virtuous choices.
The book’s final chapter, “Political Wisdom”, further supports Jagannathan’s argument from Chapter 5 that practical wisdom involves understanding practical universals. Jagannathan argues that practical wisdom (phronêsis) and political wisdom (politikê) are, for Aristotle, the same state of understanding applied to different contexts: to an individual life and to life in a political community, respectively. They are the same understanding because they understand the same subject matter, namely, the human good.
On the basis of the identity between phronêsis and politikê, Jagannathan argues that practical wisdom involves understanding universals because political wisdom does, in the form of laws that it crafts. Civic laws are universal in the sense that they apply to a range of situations, and wise rulers must understand which laws are good and why, insofar as they promote the human good—the ultimate goal of politics. In order to deliberate wisely about, identify, and choose good laws, then, a political ruler “requires an articulate understanding of the goals proper to human flourishing” (167). But Jagannathan has argued in previous chapters that this understanding is practical wisdom. Insofar as practical wisdom, applied to politics, is expressed in the formation and prescription of general laws, it follows that practical wisdom involves an understanding of general, non-situation-specific truths about the human good.
Let me now raise a question that readers may want to consider as they engage with Jagannathan’s work.
Is practical understanding true? In contemporary philosophy, we might debate whether understanding is always true and factive, or whether we can understand false or fictional things. In the context of Aristotle’s epistemology, though, it seems clear that the intellectual achievement of understanding would have to be true. The Nicomachean Ethics says this is the case for epistêmê: science or scientific understanding is always true (1139a15-18). Jagannathan rightly notices that in the very same passage, Aristotle also identifies phronêsis as a state in which we grasp the truth—specifically, practical truth. On Jagannathan’s interpretation, however, practical truth is specifically found “in virtuous choice”, which combines virtuous wish for an end with excellent deliberation about what to do in pursuit of that end (96). But even if phronêsis guarantees that we grasp practical truth and make virtuous choices, it is not clear, on Jagannathan’s interpretation, whether everything else we understand with phronêsis is true. For instance, as we have seen, he argues that phronêsis includes an understanding of our practical ends.
But is this understanding true? It seems odd (in an Aristotelian context) to deny that the phronimos grasps the truth about which ends are worth pursuing in life. But if ends are not choices (prohaireseis), our understanding of them would not be practically true. Would our understanding of ends be true in some other way, and if so, in what way? Jagannathan also says that “it is a mark of practical wisdom” to identify salient specific features of a practical situation in which we are trying to achieve a virtuous goal (143). But again, if salient particulars are not choices, does practical understanding help us discover the truth about them? Again, it seems odd (in an Aristotelian context) to deny that the phronimos grasps the truth about the salient particulars that could help them achieve their ends. But if our grasp of salient particulars is not practically true, is it true in some other way? And if phronêsis specifically guarantees that we grasp the truth in the sense of practical truth, but our grasp of ends and salient particulars is not practically true, how can a practically wise person be sure of grasping these other truths? Such questions about the relationship between truth, practical truth, and practical understanding are left open by Jagannathan’s interpretation.
REFERENCES
Annas, Julia, 1981, An Introduction to Plato’s Republic, New York: Oxford University Press.
Burnyeat, Myles, 1980, “Socrates and the Jury: Paradoxes in Plato’s Distinction between Knowledge and True Belief”, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society Supplement, 54: 173–191.
—, 1981, “Aristotle on Understanding Knowledge”, in Aristotle on Science: The Posterior Analytics, Enrico Berti (ed.), Padua: Editrice Antenoire, pp. 359–384.
Moravcsik, Julius, 1979, “Understanding and Knowledge in Plato’s Philosophy,” Neue Hefte für Philosophie, 15: 53–69.
Moss, Jessica, 2020, “Is Plato’s Epistemology About Knowledge?” in Hetherington and Smith (eds.) What the Ancients Offer to Contemporary Epistemology, New York: Routledge: 68–85.
Schwab, Whitney, 2016, “Understanding Epistēmē in Plato’s Republic”, in Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy, Volume 51, New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 41–86.
–––, 2020, “Plato’s Ideal Epistemology”, in in Hetherington and Smith (eds.) What the Ancients Offer to Contemporary Epistemology, New York: Routledge: 86–105.