Peter van Inwagen has written an excellent monograph on the metaphysics of existence. Anyone seriously interested in the subject can expect to learn much from it and to find much with which to engage. The author (hereafter, PVI) offers both an ontology—answers to the question “What is there?”—and a meta-ontology—answers to the question “How ought one to go about the business of finding out what there is?” Chapters I and V give the meta-ontology, while the interim chapters give the ontological answers about what there is. The book is bittersweet insofar as the meta-ontology is avowedly neo-Quinean, so the author tells us, while the ontology itself teems with entities that Quine would dismiss (and dismisses some he might have tolerated). The book as a whole is intended to be neo-Quinean, and in many ways, it is an homage to Quine. But as the title of the final chapter (VI) indicates, its main torso advances the anatomy of a faintly reluctant and un-Quinean Platonism. PVI’s Platonism accepts properties, propositions, and possibilities, but everything else—facts, states of affairs, bare particulars, immanent universals, mathematical entities (sets, numbers, functions &c.) must go. And they must go not because they are intelligible but inert stragglers on Plato’s beard, waiting for a tidy-up by Ockham’s Razor. They must go because talk of them is ultimately somehow meaningless.
Chapter I, “Being and Existence”, sets out the following theses: (i) Being is not an activity; (ii) There is no important distinction to be made between being and existence; (iii) Being is univocal; (iv)‘There is’ and ‘exists’ are adequately captured by the existential quantifier of modern formal logic (and not of ‘First-Order Logic’, the latter being one of the many expressions PVI will later tell us is meaningless (see 178 fn 1)); (v) Quine’s criterion of ontological commitment is a strategy to get philosophers to make their ontological commitments clear, by getting them, ideally, to a point where some suitable open sentence can be formally deduced from the sentences the philosopher accepts, and whose values for the remaining free variables must be the entities of their ideology.
PVI’s faith in his Quinean meta-ontology is not so much a belief that a philosopher’s sentences of ordinary English can be regimented by systematic transformations into other sentences using the devices of quantification and bound variables. Rather, it is a matter of excavation (my word, not his), of bringing out what was already there, if not in the syntax, but in the semantics of the original target sentences (31), awaiting a philosopher of PVI’s skill to coax them out to the level of open sentences, at which point we have, presumably, that meeting between language and the world where we are in a position to settle the ontological commitment of the quantified versions of those open sentences. To put it mildly, this procedure is one of art, not computation, and cannot be expected of our best computers to date. On the contrary, it requires a level of linguistic skill and sensitivity that PVI demonstrates throughout the volume in pursuing this tactic, first for the issue of non-beings and fictional entities, then for properties and propositions, and finally for possibilia. The generously inclined reader cannot help thinking “Maybe PVI can do all this reducing to open sentences with as much predicate calculus as possible, consistent with the sentence still saying anything at all—but what if only he has this skill?” The less generously inclined might say: “PVI’s assumptions here are tantamount to FOL (First Order Logic, an expression PVI mistrusts) being the language of thought. If so, this claim for the status of FOL is the contingent a priori if anything is.” Perhaps Neo-Quineanism should have this assumption as part of its methodology; perhaps, as I shall suggest below, it must be more generous in any event.
Chapter II employs a disjunctive slogan to be invoked throughout the volume, a reply to anyone who thinks there are entities that do not exist—someone who thinks, for example, that there are individuals in other worlds but not in this one, or individuals that inhabit this, but not other worlds; or thinks that there are fictional or mythological creatures that do not exist in our spatiotemporal cosmos, but satisfy an alternative sense of the ‘existence’ predicate. PVI’s slogan replies to all of these popular intuitions: “Either “That does too exist” or “There is no such thing as that.”
The chapter divides satisfyingly into two; a rejection of neo-Meinongianism, the position according to which there are non-existent beings; and a rejection of the being of fictional entities. Only fictional entities present a serious challenge to those who deny that there are non-existent entities, and they, fictional entities, do too exist. Neo-Meinongians are dismissed for denying a theorem of formal logic: ∃x→∃y (y=x). Naturally, the topic of fictional beings requires greater subtlety, which PVI finds in the distinction between having a property and holding a property, holding being the sort of having that goes on in fiction (in which plenty of having goes on as well). None of the entities belonging to works of fiction are effective answers to the challenge: “If you think there are things that do not exist, give me an example of one.” This chapter will be of interest to metaphysicians in general but especially to those doing metaphysics within the field of aesthetics.
Chapter III contains most of the positive themes of the book, and its conclusions are to be collected later in the final Chapter ‘Lightweight Platonism’. What makes PVI’s Platonism lightweight is that it is committed to the existence of properties and committed to the consequences of their being abstract. “We must affirm the existence of properties if we are to affirm all the things we need to say.”
The stalking horse for his account of properties is Lewis, whom he fingers as the only philosopher he has heard of who has identified the role that properties are supposed to play: Lewis said that the property role is occupied by sets of possible individuals. (I have heard of another. Pavel Tichý identified properties as functions from truth values to individuals, an answer that goes unencumbered by the criticisms meted out to Lewis.) The introduction of ‘role’ talk is crucial here, for identifying roles first and foremost is just what PVI takes his neo-Quinean meta-ontology to consist of: the identifying of metaphysical roles and the discovery of what can play them, or at least be ‘pressed into service’ for them. I shall have more to say about roles below.
For Lewis, the property of being a pig is therefore the set of all and only the possible pigs. But this cannot be right insofar as, besides the pigs of our world (whether or not our world is the actual world), this set includes among its members non-actual pigs—and PVI observes, in Quinean mode, that there is no reason for any of us to believe that there are non-actualpigs. (And if there were such entities, how could they enter into our thoughts?)
PVI, by contrast, identifies properties as assertibles. For him, unsaturated assertibles are properties, (more precisely, 115, “unsaturated assertibles can successfully play the property role”, my italics), and saturated assertibles are propositions. As he notes, if this is so, much that has been said over the last century about properties is false. No property can be a part or a constituent of any concrete object; it makes no sense to say that properties are more basic or fundamental than those objects of which they are properties; properties are in no sense objects of perception; some properties are uninstantiated; existence is a property (although not of course the sort of property an individual can have or lack); there are haecceities; and every member of this richly un-Quinean cornucopia exists of necessity. For modern metaphysicians, this Chapter is likely to be the most interesting one in the book.
Chapter IV is PVI’s account of modality and is taken up largely with an engagement with Lewis’s modal realism. Possibilities are now added to the ontology PVI accepts. He does this by rejecting Lewis’s reduction of modal concepts, in favour of a primitive relation between worlds, expressed as ‘from the standpoint of’, which allows him to formulate a new non-Lewisian definition of truth-in-a-world and existence-in-a-world. The chapter is difficult and technical but filled with evidence for PVI’s claims that he can follow the dictates of the Quinenan meta-ontology down to the last free variable. The Chapter also contains an epistolary correspondence on possible ways of being between PVI and the late Derek Parfit, for whom the being of the path not taken was something that mattered a great deal. This exchange is the liveliest and most accessible part of the chapter, and all enthusiasts of Parfit’s work will want to see how he engages with PVI. (PVI emerges a gracious victor in my view.)
Chapter V returns to the meta-ontology of Chapter I; and I confess that here I am at a loss to see how PVI’s global approach is going to work out, despite the attractiveness and ingenuity of the preceding chapters. At the beginning of the volume, PVI lambasts Arthur Prior for trying to quantify over values in argument places to which entities with truth values belong; that is, Prior quantifies over propositions, in such sentences as ‘For some p, Paul believes that p and Elmer does not believe that p’. There may be something meriting objection here, but PVI’s ontology rightly tolerates propositions; and as the final chapter reveals most explicitly, the meta-ontology is committed to something even higher up the chain of abstraction from propositions: roles. A Quinean meta-ontology consists of identifying various metaphysical roles; and then asking what kind of—PVI does not like the expression, but I cannot here avoid it—first-order entities might play those roles. Two quotations from the conclusion of the book should show what I mean. Firstly, part of a list of entities PVI deems talk of which to be strictly nonsensical by his Quinean meta-ontology:
mathematical entities: sets, numbers, vectors, functions, operators (241, underlining mine)
(Readers of the whole extensive list should note that the two truth values T and F are absent from this list, and also from the shorter list of that which is acceptable. They are surely admissible if anything is—perhaps they come along for the ride with propositions.)
And now,
There are perhaps no better examples of Quinean “roles” that are demonstrably present in our discourse and which demand to be filled than the “mathematical objects” roles—the “set” role, the “number” role, the “function” role, and so on. But in this case, metaphysical reasoning can present us with a plethora of kinds of object that can play each of these roles. (243, emphasis original)
Here I join the author in his tactic of being suspicious of positions he says he does not understand. And I do not understand how it can be that talk of roles is so demonstrably present in current English discourse, while the “everything here must go” list is as long as it is, and contains, as it does, both sets and functions. I am happy to accept that every function is a role, and that not every role is a function. For, as it might, it is true that any two functions taking the same arguments to the same values are not, after all, two functions, but only a single one; and yet there might be two genuinely individuated roles with necessarily the same extension, such as the property of being red and the property of seeming red in ordinary light to ordinary observers. But that is only from an exercise of my imagination, and I am left unclear as to why part of the class of roles generally is deemed unintelligible. And if an assertible is not a kind of function, from individuals to truth-values, then I do not know what it is; and I certainly do not see how, if it is not such a function, a saturated assertible is a proposition. But since assertibles belong to the list of what PVI admits, has he not already answered questions about functions by accepting properties and propositions? And if roles are the starting point of Quinean meta-ontology, why are functions on the naughty list at all? Are they not roles with more precise individuation conditions than roles in general, hence their indispensability in mathematics?
I think PVI is quite right to say that role talk is demonstrably present in our discourse, but roles are hardly reason’s nearest kin. There will be those who think that “The 47th President” is a name for Trump, who will then be puzzled to find out that, if so, then Kamala Harris wanted to be Donald Trump; or that she might have been Donald Trump, if the expression in inverted commas were a name for that individual. How can Russell’s “On Denoting” have been as poorly understood as it has been since its publication, while talk of the entities of grade school mathematics is, strictly speaking, nonsense?
Some well understood roles are functions from world times to individuals: the role of the present King of France takes a perfectly well-defined function from a world time to an individual. In our current case, that function has no individual as its value, since there is no current King of France (although there used to be, and there could have been and could be again). The same complaint goes for PVI’s treatment of properties, which for him must also be functions—if they are to be anything so much as like Fregean concepts, which his very terminology—assertibles, which are plausibly the meanings of Fregean concepts—tells us they are. It is hard to avoid the suspicion that in the case of functions, PVI’s meta-ontology rests on that which he would kick away.
Chapter VI reveals PVI’s results, and why he calls the edifice he has constructed one consisting of “Lightweight Platonism”. Still troubled that his economy is too parsimonious for the ontology of mathematics, the author offers a spirited and plausible hypothesis of an ersatz set theory—sets, not as we know them from Frege and Zermelo-Fraenkel and their subsequent axiomatic refinement &c., but as haecceities and disjunctions of them. This passage will be of interest to metaphysicians in general, but especially to those wishing to see him make good on the suspicious eye cast on the Grounding project in the Introduction and earlier passages of the book. Socrates is separated out from his own singleton set {Socrates} in favor of the relation that human animal bore to his own haecceity, ‘= Socrates’, a necessary being that exists in all possible worlds including those in which there is nothing, as it were, on the left-hand side of the property i.e., no such individual as Socrates.
PVI affirms the being of properties, relations, and propositions, all of them universalia ante rem. All of them, by the arguments of III, are assertibles, and none of them has any causal power—it is the causal impotence of all his abstractathat makes PVI’s Platonism “Lightweight”. Despite the ingenuity of the ersatz reconstituting of sets, he concludes imprudently with Plato’s Eleatic Principle from the Sophist, according to which anything is a being so long as it ever acts or is acted upon. For PVI, causing involves interaction among those things with spatiotemporal determination—it is the kind of acting upon that the physicists talk about. But Plato had something far richer in mind, including the idea that something (a Form) could count as a being just if it were, even if only on one occasion, an object of thought; and being an object of thought is very far from being the object of spatiotemporal efficient causation. And this brings us back to the Prior with which PVI began. Prior was not saying that propositions cause anything. Indeed he was at pains to say that propositional variables do not name anything at all, as nominal variables—when given their objectual interpretation—may stand for respectable spatiotemporal members of the causal club. Prior was talking about propositions as objects of thought, and the opportunity to show where he went wrong in thinking this again escapes the author. Perhaps he thinks that thinking of something can only be a relation between a physical thing and a physical thing—if he does, he does not say so, but I concluded the book still thinking Prior was owed the oxygen of greater candor if he was to be dragged about at the start—and dragged about as Quine’s bugbear.
In conclusion: George Boolos was no doubt right and would be friendly to PVI here when he said “The lesson to be drawn from the foregoing reflections on plurals and second-order logic is that neither the use of plurals nor the employment of second-order logic commits us to the existence of extra items [sc. Sets for example] beyond those to which we are already committed” (1999, 72). But at the same time, it is a further assumption that there is no metaphysical import to the difference between first-order logic and other logics. If there is, it takes more than what PVI has been willing to acknowledge. The differences between first-order logic (remembering that PVI disdains the term) and second-order logic (SOL) are enormous: In FOL, semantic consequence is compact; not so in SOL. In FOL there is a complete and consistent proof procedure for logical truth; not so in SOL; in FOL, the Löwenheim-Skolem theorem holds; not so in SOL. These differences can hardly, with any seriousness, be dismissed as disguised set theory tacked on to FOL; any logic that quantifies over predicate variables has an entirely different landscape from FOL. In any event, that such differences between FOL and SOL can be so much as made out shows that they are far from nonsensical. Perhaps it is a fool’s paradise, but the idea that the logical differences have neither sense nor metaphysical import calls for more defense than PVI offers.
But that is just one of many symptoms of my limited understanding. Fortunately, my understanding is not sufficiently limited to prevent me from affirming that PVI’s book is deep, rich, excellent, and a must-read for all students of metaphysics.
REFERENCE
“To Be is To Be a Value of a Variable (Or to Be Some Values of Some Variables”. Boolos, George, and Richard Carl Jeffrey. Logic, Logic and Logic. Cambridge (Mass.): Harvard university press, 1999.