Being, Nature, and Life in Aristotle: Essays in Honor of Allan Gotthelf

The volume is recommended to the following people: Anyone interested in the current debate about Aristotle's concept of nature and scientific method of teleological explanation should read Sedley's article. Anyone interested in definition or in the middle books of the Metaphysics should read the five essays on Zeta and Theta and the essay on the Posterior Analytics. And anyone interested in On the Parts of Animals, Generation of Animals, or Nicomachean Ethics should read the essays devoted to those texts. Although it is unlikely that every essay will be of equal interest to everyone working in the increasingly specialized field of Aristotle studies, it is undeniable that this volume contains a great cast of contributors, and even if not every essay offers a bold new interpretation (as a few indeed do), they all display inventiveness and insight in their approach to, in some cases, very well worn issues. The volume should therefore be considered a necessary addition to any library of Aristotle studies. It has been expertly edited, includes footnotes (not endnotes), and is lacking neither bibliography, nor an index locorum, nor a general index. I thank the editors for seeing through such a wide-ranging and even exciting volume of essays on Aristotle.

I will confine myself in what follows to a few comments on each of the kinds of essay included in the volume, beginning with Sedley's article, moving on to discuss the papers on definition and on the middle books of the Metaphysics (about which I have less to say), and ending with the papers on individual works.

Sedley, on the basis first of his influential article "Is Aristotle's Teleology Anthropocentric?" and then his 2004 Sather lectures Creationism and its Critics in Antiquity, has become the primary exponent of a "global-teleology interpretation".^[1] He notes that he is in the same camp with Cooper, Kahn, Code, and Matthen,^[2] and that the primary critics of this view are Pellegrin, Wardy, Judson, Bodnár, and myself (n42).^[3] In the present article ("Teleology, Aristotelian and Platonic") Sedley argues that in "the explanation of purposive structures in the world . . . most can be learnt by emphasizing, rather than minimizing, Aristotle's Platonic background and training" (5).

The first difficulty here, of which Sedley is well aware, is that "the explanation of purposive structures in the world" is ambiguous between: (1) the explanation of why and how the world as a whole (as a cosmos) should be understood as purposive, and (2) the explanation of why and how specific structures (e.g., leaves, eyes, or hands) should be understood as purposive. Sedley readily concedes that it is difficult to find explicit statements supporting a global teleology in Aristotle: "Aristotle does not very often stand back to view the matter panoramically in this way, for his interest is far more often taken up with specific biological structures and processes and their contribution to the organism's success" (8). But when we turn to his explanation of specific organisms and their organs, we here find even less evidence of global teleology, or rather none at all. Aristotle never explains the parts or activities of organisms as being for the sake of other species, human beings, or the gods. "The one notable exception, widely cited", Sedley notes, "is PA 4.13.696b25-32, on the inconvenient positioning of the shark's mouth underneath, partly to spare other species" (n40). But even that single passage does not in any way support a global teleology.

Sedley's attempt to turn this complete lack of evidence for global teleology throughout the biological works into a virtue of his own position is not, in my opinion, convincing. He notes that Plato's treatments of anatomy in several passages in the Timaeus also "have very little to say about the global perspective", and that these sections "correspond functionally to Aristotelian zoology". Perhaps one could make that case for Aristotle's account of human anatomy (although I doubt this very much), but to claim that there is some kind of correspondence between Plato's account of human anatomy in the Timaeus and Aristotle's zoology is to radically underestimate the innovativeness of Aristotle in setting up a new and (as Bolton argues in his contribution to the present volume, discussed below) autonomous science of biology. Setting this aside, Sedley says of Plato's remarks about human anatomy in the Timaeus,

like Aristotle's biological works, they are squarely focused on individual bodily functioning. Provided that Aristotle's physical and theological writings supply the missing global perspective on teleology, the relative restraint shown in the biological treatises should be read as symptomatic, not of his emancipation from Plato but, if anything, of a continuing debt to him (25, emphasis added).

But then the problem is, as Sedley himself noted earlier, that "Aristotle does not very often stand back to view the matter panoramically in this way" (8). The few cases in which Aristotle does stand back to view the matter panoramically, such as the theological discussion of Metaphysics Lambda 10, do not seem to me so much to elaborate a doctrine of global teleology as to raise an aporia, or rather a series of them, that confront any such view, which had already been advanced not only by Plato, but already by Socrates, according to Xenophon.

This is not to say that there is no profit in closely comparing Aristotle's and Plato's views, and there are undeniably many points of conscious and unconscious resemblances, as Sedley shows in his valuable discussion of the analogy between nature and art. But one could also cite passages in which there is a strong contrast between their views. For example, Aristotle certainly cannot agree with Plato's Athenian in the Laws X: "the grand and primary works and creations, precisely because they come in the category 'primary', will be attributable to art. Natural things, and nature herself -- to use the mistaken terminology of our opponents -- will be secondary products from art and reason".^[4] For Aristotle is emphatic that art imitates nature and not vice versa.^[5] Thus any kind of "intelligent design" or "creationism" of nature and natural things is impossible for Aristotle, since craft does not and cannot create nature but rather follows or imitates it in creating and designing its artificial products.

Sedley is well aware of this, and yet he thinks that the comparison with certain passages of Plato shows Aristotle's Platonism when it comes to teleology. But in the context of natural philosophy at least, Aristotle praises Democritus more frequently and more highly than Plato, for example: "generally, no one made any progress concerning anything beyond the surface, except Democritus. Democritus, however, seems to have carefully investigated all of these things, and even to be distinguished in the way he did so" (GC I.2 315a34-b1; cf. PA I.1 642a26-27; Metaph. XIII.4 1078b20). Perhaps Aristotle's own innovations in natural philosophy deserve the kind of praise that he gives to Democritus and are partly obscured "by emphasizing Aristotle's Platonic background and training".

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Turning to Bolton's contribution ("Biology and metaphysics in Aristotle"), we immediately find a thesis that stands in stark contrast to Sedley's: "biology, for Aristotle, is an autonomous theoretical science"; specifically, "biology is separate from and autonomous with respect to metaphysics in general" (30). Bolton's point is not to enter into the disputes about theology and teleology, but rather to call into question the tendency or trend of recent interpreters of Aristotle's Metaphysics to look to the biological works for a deeper understanding of Aristotle's metaphysical account of substance. Bolton takes Aristotle's statements in Gamma 3 about the errors and excesses of natural philosophers commenting on and studying general truths "due to a lack of education in the Analytics" (1005b3-4) to imply that "there is no room at all for overlap in content or subject matter, for Aristotle, between metaphysics and biology or physics" (32, emphasis added). Thus Bolton calls into question some recent attempts to read biological theses into the Metaphysics, especially those that would claim to supersede the physical or biological works. Bolton cites several older articles to exemplify the point, but Sedley's contribution to the present volume is an even more striking example, since Sedley argues that a proper understanding of the theology of the Metaphysics (in particular Lambda 10) is necessary in order to understand or explain the existence of functional biological structures.

The majority of Bolton's paper is given over to advancing an interpretation of Metaphysics Zeta 17 that "does not violate [Aristotles’s] requirement of autonomy and separateness for metaphysics and biology" (49). The metaphysical issues around the factors of definition and the role of causality therein do not determine the scientific definition of biological species, including human beings; in fact, "the only possible scientific answer to the question 'What makes something a member of the human species?' must come from the biologist, not the metaphysician" (51).

These issues of definition are the subject of two other contributions to the present volume, Code's ("An Aristotelian puzzle about definition: Metaphysics Ζ.12") and Gill's ("Unity of definition inMetaphysics Η.6 and Ζ.12"). I recommend both essays as models of clarity and analytical precision. Code introduces the problem as it is presented in Posterior Analytics II 6 (and represented again in Metaphysics Zeta 12 and Eta 6). Code productively brings not only the Posterior Analytics framework to bear on the issues discussed in the two chapters of the Metaphysics, but also brings in several relevant passages in the Topics (94). He concludes by discussing how Aristotle's definition will answer a question such as "Why man is such and such an animal?" (96) in the form of a syllogism involving a middle term that explains why a predicate such as "two-footed" belongs to a subject like "man".

 Code reasonably suggests that we would have to look to Aristotle's account of the soul to find an explanation of why a certain kind of living thing is the kind of thing it is. This seems to be in agreement with Bolton's claim that one must look to the biologist (or psychologist), not the metaphysician, for the proper definition of a living thing such as a human being. And it seems most reasonable to think that the explanation of human bipedalism, for example, will come as a result of the sciences of psychology, ethology, biology, etc. and not as a result of reflections on the metaphysics and epistemology of the relation between form and matter (much less on the theology of the stellar rotations). This point is supported by another contribution to the volume ("Definition in Aristotle's Posterior Analytics"), in which Pellegrin argues that Aristotle considers causal-explanatory syllogistic definitions to be logically prior to and the condition for all other kinds of definition (140).

The point brought out by Code and Pellegrin about the need for substantive causal definitions informed by the relevant natural sciences brings us back to Bolton’s point about the autonomy of the natural sciences from metaphysics and theology. In this connection I want to call attention to a general principle discussed by Aristotle in Posterior Analytics I 13 (78b34-79a13). In no case should one permit "kind-crossing" explanations (for example, explaining biological facts by means of metaphysical or theological considerations), except where there is an official relationship of one science being "under" another (and thus subordinate or subalternate to another).^[6] This obtains, for example, in the science of meteorological "iris"-phenomena (such as rainbows and halos) being subordinate to the sciences of optics, which is in turn subordinate to geometry. Thus it is legitimate to appeal to the science of the optics of reflection (or refraction), and ultimately to the geometrical definition of a circle in the explanation of the meteorological phenomena of the lunar halo (as Aristotle does in Meteorology III 2-3)^,[7] but it does not, on the other hand, seem legitimate to explain the nature of rainfall by reference to the growth of crops planted by human farmers (as some "global" teleologists would have it),^[8] since meteorology is not subordinate to agriculture. This, at least, seems to be the policy of the Posterior Analytics (and, in the case of rainfall, of the Meteorology).

This issue of the autonomy or subordination of sciences also pertains to several of the examples used by Aristotle in the middle books of the Metaphysics and examined in interesting detail in Gill's paper. Thus she notes (101) that in Aristotle's discussion of the unity of definition problem in Eta 6, his focus is not on biological organisms (such as human beings), but on bronze spheres (and later bronze triangles and white surfaces), and the reason is that the biological examples are complicated by the fact that organic matter lasts only as long as the biological compound (and thus a severed hand is not, biologically speaking, a hand). Gill discusses at length and fruitfully Aristotle's example of sound as both genus and matter in Zeta 12 (105-107). She provides the background of the issue in Plato's Philebus. I would add to this the fact that Aristotle describes harmonics as a science subordinate to arithmetic in the Posterior Analytics passage referred to above (78b38), thus permitting a specific case of "kind-crossing".

The present volume contains two essays that are essentially condensed commentaries on Metaphysics Theta 7 and 8 and the metaphysics of potentiality (dunamis) and actuality (as Charles translatesenergeia; cf. Broadie's "activity"). Broadie's paper, the shortest contribution to the volume, titled "Where is the activity?: (An Aristotelian worry about the telic status of energeia)", is more narrowly focused on Theta 8.  She includes an appendix entitled "Analysis of the argument of Metaphysics 1050a4-b4" (209-211), which consists of seven Roman-numbered lemmas with Bekker references and elliptical Greek transliterated in parentheses, followed by glosses and internal cross-references. Charles' paper ("Metaphysics Θ.7 and 8: some issues concerning actuality and potentiality") is also laid out more or less as a commentary: Theta 7 is broken into four passages translated under the Bekker references, followed by commentary, including a lot of useful sub-structuring and occasional restructuring of Aristotle's arguments.  Passages in Theta 8 are then commented on less systematically and more selectively (without block translations).

Charles' overall interpretation involves a teleological understanding of the notion of matter in Theta 7: "my interpretation has rested on (i) giving the term 'entelecheia' in 1049a5-6 a teleological gloss (what has the goal in it) and (ii) pointing to some teleological material in Theta 8" (183). He concludes with a paragraph oddly entitled "Interim Conclusions" (suggesting this paper is part of a larger commentary on the middle books):

I have tried to understand why Aristotle sought to conceptualize matter and form in terms of actuality and capacity (or potentiality) in parts of Theta 6-8. My suggestion is that he did so to capture the importance of teleology for a proper understanding of the required ontology. While I have not attempted to discuss the details of Aristotle's teleology, it provides the key to a proper understanding of these chapters of his Metaphysics (197).

The problem I see with this "interim conclusion" (without here remarking on the value of his commentary on Theta 6-8) is that the nature of Aristotle's teleology is so controversial that I have doubts that an interpretation of it that does not "discuss the details", and in fact does not even make its own interpretation of that teleology explicit, can unlock "a proper understanding" of Theta 6-8.

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I turn now to the third group of articles included in the volume, those which offer a narrower study of Aristotle than Sedley but wider than the papers focused on definition in the middle books of the Metaphysics and the Posterior Analytics. These include very solid and useful contributions, beginning with Lennox ("The unity and purpose of On the Parts of Animals I"). Lennox argues that the methodological discussion of PA I 1-5 is meant as a prolegomena to the entire series of biological works, including the Generation of Animals, which arguably contains, in a late chapter, a reference to PA I 1-5 with the terms "principles in the primary accounts" (56-58). Further, Lennox argues, applying a line of argument developed in an earlier essay (2001, ch. 4), that "virtually every topic discussed in these five chapters bridges a gap between the basic framework of scientific inquiry and knowledge found in the Posterior Analytics and the needs of an investigation of natural substances subject to unqualified coming-to-be and passing away" (59-60).

These claims are of the greatest import to the understanding of Aristotle's biology, and although the full proof of them is contained in other publications of Lennox, the present essay is an excellent starting point for someone looking for an overview of the issues. Lennox suggests that, despite the prima facie impression of stylistic differences between different parts of the work, an integral interpretation of PA I 1-5 is possible if we take into account what Lennox calls the "narrative unity" of the work, which he compares to "the sort of unity that is referred to as plot when one is discussing fiction writing" (61). This is useful, but perhaps a more pertinent comparison would be to the kind of unity one expects to find in a philosophical dialogue, a form of writing that Aristotle, following Plato, actually practiced (and there have been recent attempts to reconstruct some of his lost dialogues).^[9] Since we are dealing with scientific ideas there is a strong disanalogy with the way plot works in fiction, but a strong analogy with the way that in philosophical dialogues, as in PA I,

once a certain position has been established, argument will proceed on the assumption that the reader has taken that position on board. Later arguments will look incomplete on their own, because they depend on the reader's assuming a number of premises that go unmentioned. Like reading a plot, one cannot jump around randomly in the text and hope to fully understand what is going on (61).

I will comment on only one more of the many and diverse issues discussed in Lennox's paper: the integration of the first half of PA I 5, which contains a famous exhortation or protreptic to the life sciences, with the rest of Book I. Lennox offers convincing reasons to think that this section did not originate as a separate work that was put where it now stands by a later editor, despite the radical stylistic differences between it and the rest of the book. D. S. Hutchinson and I are prepared to argue that this is one of several documentable cases in which Aristotle reworked material from his (lost) dialogue Protrepticus to Philosophy into a different (and non-dialogue) work; other cases include Metaphysics I.1-2; Nicomachean Ethics I.7-8 and X.6-8; and Politics VII.1-3. This reworking of hortatory material from the Protrepticus accounts for the stylistic differences from the methodological sections of PA I 1-5, but allows the argument of the first half of PA I 5 to be seen as integral to the biological works as a whole. The Protrepticus contains, in addition to an extended version of the first part of PA I 1 and strong parallels to the first part of I 5, at least one other very rich passage on biology (the one, mentioned above, that repeatedly invokes the principle that art imitates nature and not vice-versa).^[10]

Kosman ("Male and female in Aristotle's Generation of Animals") has contributed an article that, for my purposes, has already become the recommended starting point for students researching Aristotle's account of sex and reproduction. A common interpretation, which has been reproduced in the arguments of some feminist critics of Aristotle (150), has it that on Aristotle's account male and female are two different or opposite modes of animal being, one of which is fully human and the other somehow imperfectly or deformedly human, and one of which has the power of generation while the other completely lacks it. The male is supposed to (actively) provide the form, while the female only (passively) provides the matter. There are no passages in Aristotle that say as much, but this interpretation has been advanced largely on the basis of a certain reading of a few passages (GA I 20, 729a9-11; cf. II 1, 732a34).

Kosman shows that the view that according to Aristotle the male provides the active and substantial form while the female provides the passive matter (i.e., the menses) goes back to Alexander of Aphrodisias, but not to Aristotle (151). Those surprisingly few cases in which Aristotle does say that the male provides the form must be interpreted with the utmost caution. Kosman emphasizes Aristotle's account of the male as the initiator or origin of the motions that cause matter to be rearranged into a homospecific animal form. Aristotle sees the male contribution as being the "initiator" of action in a way that Kosman compares to how we now say that the zygote is a fertilized egg "rather than, for example, a fertilized sperm, or perhaps an egged sperm" (160). Why do biologists (and everyone else) tend to think of the sperm as doing something to the egg, and not the other way around? Kosman offers some interesting speculations as to why this might be, and why Aristotle might have thought so too. The only criticism I have is that I would have liked to have heard more about the rival views that Aristotle aims to replace. Kosman mentions only poetic sources (Aeschylus' Eumenides 657-64; Euripides' Orestes 552) in his description of the preformationist theories, and has nothing to say about the account of reproduction in the Hippocratic corpus, or even in Democritus, a philosopher Aristotle directly engaged at length on this issue.

Finally, we come to the longest essay in the volume (three times as long as the shortest, and almost twice as long as any other in the volume), in which Cooper ("Political community and the highest good") offers an attractive account of Aristotle's statement, in the final chapter of the Nicomachean Ethics, exhorting the student of ethics to proceed to the study of constitutional systems and laws (X 9, 1180a32ff). One might be surprised or dubious at the claim that "we [meaning his readers or hearers, including himself as studying alongside them as he lectures] need now to study laws and constitutions in order to be able, ourselves, to act in accordance with the virtues (1179b1-2) -- that is, to attain happiness and live happy lives" (213, emphasis in original). The Nicomachean Ethics is thus not a stand-alone treatise of ethics, but is conceived of as part of an integral "philosophy concerned with anthropology" (hê peri ta anthrôpina philosophia, X.9) that includes not only politics but presumably economics or household management as well.

Cooper says, "it is clear that the course of study completed in the Ethics itself has not accomplished all its goals" (225), which I think is right insofar as it has not accomplished the goals of this larger philosophical anthropology, but is wrong insofar as nowhere in the Ethics (or anywhere else) does Aristotle set himself the goal of a self-contained study of ethics that he then fails to deliver. In fact, the opening of the Ethics explicitly refers to a hierarchy of practical sciences, of which "the most authoritative science, the highest master science . . . is obviously the science of politics" (1094a26-28). Incidentally, this relates to the point I made above about Aristotle's policy with regards to autonomous sciences and kind-crossing: here we have an explicit indication of a scientific subordination: the science of the good of individual human conduct is "obviously" subordinate to the science of the good of human communities, and so we can expect (unlike the case of metaphysics and biology), that there will be top-down political considerations that govern, so to speak, ethical inquiry.

Cooper's discussion of Aristotle's statement that "we" need now to study laws and constitutions brings to the fore the important question of the audience of the Nicomachean Ethics, a point that is sometimes overlooked by those who read it as a systematic treatise on ethics and assume that its audience are students of philosophy in essentially the same situation as the present-day reader. Cooper speculates that: "those who come to the study of ethics/politics are only basically decent, young adult, but still somewhat unformed people. Certainly, they are not, strictly speaking, morally virtuous yet" (218). The purpose of the Nicomachean Ethics-Politics as a whole, to quote from two sub-headers of Cooper's essay, is to be not only an "aid to self-improvement" (225), but also a "handbook for political leaders" (220). Cooper gives an extensive and valuable analysis of Aristotle's concept of "political community" and how it functions as an interdependent whole in a way that makes it impossible to treat ethics as a private or individual project.

Although, apart from Lennox's essay, the philosophical arguments of Allan Gotthelf are not discussed or debated, the volume contains a biographical sketch (xii-xv) and a chronological list of his contributions to classical philosophy, including a bibliography (265-269). Several of the individual authors have dedicated their contributions to him. I would like to take this opportunity to thank him for some of his work that does not come up in the present volume, but is nevertheless a very important contribution to the field of Aristotle studies: his completion of D. M. Balme's edition (text and critical apparatus) of Aristotle's Historia animalium (Cambridge Classical Texts and Commentaries Series, 2002).

I hope that I have been able, in the limited space I was allocated for this review, to give some impression of the wide-ranging and interesting material contained in this anthology. I encourage anyone that is interested in as broad and diverse a set of subjects as Being, Nature, and Life in Aristotle to check it out.