The concept of truth has consistently occupied a central place in our philosophical reflection, as it serves as a vital bridge between ourselves and the world around us. It is a commonsense truism that what is true hinges on how things actually are. As Aristotle famously articulated it in book Gamma of his Metaphysics––“truth is to say of what is that it is and of what is not that it is not” (1011b27). Yet, to understand truth solely in this manner neglects another equally essential condition for its existence: truths require articulation. For something to be true, it must first exist, and the things we usually call ‘true’, namely sentences, are human creations. Therefore, unless one subscribes to a Platonist view of truth-bearers, for there to be truths, someone must tell them. Someone must care enough about how things are to convey it accurately through language. Thus, truths are as much a part of our human ethos as they are faithful depictions of the world. Guillermo Hurtado’s latest book serves as a powerful reminder of the philosophical importance of recognizing the central role truth plays in our lives, as an essential condition to fully understanding what truth really is.
According to Hurtado, the history of our discipline reveals two traditional approaches to truth as a philosophical topic. The first approach defines truth fundamentally as a form of adequacy—specifically, a correspondence between a representation and what it stands for. Other important aspects of truth, such as our propensity to seek and treasure truths, the practical advantages of true beliefs over false ones, the fact that we consider lying wrong and value the honesty of those who do not keep secrets from us, are explained as derived from this defining property. In stark contrast, the second tradition, which is less concerned with logical, semantic, and metaphysical affairs, and more focused on axiological and pedagogical ones, asserts that truth is fundamentally a kind of good. Here the explanation is inverted: our tendency to conceive truth as adequacy is rooted in its usefulness, its propensity to yield positive outcomes, its ability to solve our problems, and its role in helping us navigate the world (29).
For Hurtado, any good philosophical conception of truth should not only explain what differentiates it from falsehood (and how they relate to one another), but also illuminate what distinguishes truth-telling from lying. Additionally, it should throw light on how truth (and falsehood) are connected to phenomena such as ignorance, inquiry, sincerity and secrecy. He argues that the second tradition is better equipped to satisfy this desideratum, as it recognizes that the factors determining which truths are worth pursuing versus those that can be ignored, which ones should be published and which ones should remain confidential, etc., are not based solely on their accuracy or lack thereof, but rather on their consequences for human life.
Hurtado’s contribution to this second tradition, which he traces back to figures like Plato (in contrast to Aristotle) and Saint Augustine (in contrast to Thomas Aquinas), begins with the concept of “rectitude”, which he defines as the general virtue an entity attains when it fulfills its purpose—“its objective, its mission, its duty” (27, my translation). For certain representations, like sentences, their primary aim is to represent facts. When they succeed in this, we consider them true. In this way, truth can be understood as a form of rectitude, and representation as more fundamental than truth itself. After all, it is human beings who create representations, and it is our needs and interests that determine the function of these representations. If sentences serve any purpose, it is one that is pertinent to us. Like most representations, sentences are artifacts with their own proper function. In Hurtado’s account, this function is to communicate valuable information, and this is what gives truth its normative force. Consequently, truth emerges as an eminently human value, with both a history and a politics. With regard to this, in the final pages of the book, Hurtado concludes that since it is intrinsic to human nature to seek truth, lacking a social environment in which one can share this political orientation towards truth ultimately hampers the development of this essential aspect of our humanity.
Of course, as Hurtado himself recognizes, talking about the function of sentences is already an idealization since we use sentences for many different purposes. We use them to lie, for example. Hence, if we identified the truth of a sentence with the fulfillment of its purpose, we would have to conclude that lies that are believed are, therefore, also true since they have fulfilled their purpose. Fiction presents a similar challenge. If what made a sentence true was the achievement of its goal, then it would be true that there is a land of Oz and that Juan Preciado is dead since these sentences constitute a central part of very successful works of fiction. In consequence, whoever, like Hurtado, wants to maintain a harmony between the conceptions of truth as adequacy and truth as rectitude needs to respond to the challenges raised by lies and fiction. Fortunately, there are several strategies available. Perhaps the most common one is to claim that these uses of sentences are exceptional and that their success is derived from that of true sentences. However, as Hurtado also points out, this strategy is not without problems. One of these problems is how to respond to the Nietzschean genealogical challenge. In Nietzsche’s genealogy, the function of representation is not, as is often thought in the Aristotelian tradition, to say of what is that it is and of what it is not that it is not, but to pass what is not as if it were and what is as if it were not. That is, the function of representation is to lie.
Hurtado expresses strong skepticism toward Nietzsche’s genealogical project, arguing that the significance of truth in our lives is far less contingent than Nietzscheans suggest. According to Hurtado, the reasons we prioritize truth, if not ahistorical, are at least still pertinent in our current context. In a telling passage, Hurtado encapsulates the essence of his disagreement thus:
It makes no sense to say that things could have been radically different when we are dealing with “things” like truth. Even if we grant that there is some contingency involved. . . “things” are as they are in relation to truth. . .because there are solid causes and reasons for them to be that way. These causes and reasons are not to be found lost in an archaic past, but are still present today: they are the common conditions of everyday life, which make us pursue the truth in the hustle and bustle of our lives. (63, My translation)
In contrast to Nietzsche’s genealogy, Hurtado offers up his own. In it, the fundamental function of sentences is communication, and we develop the concept of truth to collectively distinguish which assertions deserve our endorsement. In this genealogy, truth emerges as an eminently human, social, and normative notion.
Unfortunately, it is hard to see how offering a new genealogy qualifies as an adequate response to Nietzsche’s challenge. After all, as Hurtado himself recognizes, Nietzsche’s genealogy aims “to reveal that what we now consider necessary, irrefutable and fixed is, actually, contingent, questionable and modifiable” (60, My translation). Thus, its goal is not to prove that lying is the proper function of sentences but to challenge those, like Hurtado, who argue that sentences naturally aim at truth. In other words, one can think of genealogies as historical thought experiments that explore how a practice might have emerged and thrived in a specific historical and social context. They do not seek to tell us how things actually happened, but rather how things could have happened. Consequently, to defend the thesis that truth is a form of rectitude, it is insufficient to provide only a narrative about how the practice of assertion and the technology of sentences might have developed to facilitate communication and manage social trust. Hurtado must also rule out other alternative genealogies where truth is not the primary driving force. After all, Nietzscheans acknowledge the possibility that sentences emerged as tools for communication, driven by truth, as long as it is also recognized that things could have also happened otherwise. Yes, truth may have played a central role in the development of our current linguistic practices, but it may also have not.
In Hurtado’s story, to explain why we lie, for example, it is fundamental to understand first why we tell the truth. Lying, as a practice, only makes sense within the context of prevailing expectations of truth-telling. People tell lies because people believe them enough of the time, and people believe lies because they are rare, i.e., because people tell the truth most of the time. But to evaluate Hurtado’s proposal, we also need to consider the opposite hypothesis, i.e., that in order to explain why we tell the truth, it is fundamental to understand first why we lie. On this alternative account, we tell the truth so that people believe us when we eventually lie. Our purpose in telling the truth is that people believe us because if people do not believe us, we cannot lie to them. As a genealogy, both stories seem to me equally well entrenched in “the common conditions of daily life” (63, my translation). However, the question of why one should prefer one over the other remains open.
Ultimately, Hurtado’s work should be seen not so much as a defense of the idea that truth is a kind of rectitude, but as an exploration and development of this highly suggestive hypothesis. Viewed in this light, it offers valuable insights into the human aspects of truth and the history of its philosophy, many of which I have only briefly touched upon in this review.