Biological Essentialism

Prior to the introduction of Darwinian and Mendelian ideas and their later integration in the early 20th Century, it was common to view organisms as having essences: intrinsic characters shared by each member of a species, which was distinct from all other species. Darwin and later evolutionary thinkers undermined these ideas. Members of a species—whose boundaries may be indefinite—often exhibit wide variation in phenotypic traits and in underlying genetic and other determinants of phenotypes (for brevity I’ll refer, misleadingly, to any such factors as “genetic”). Because of this variability, many biologists and philosophers have come to think that members of a species need not share particular internal causal properties—genetic or otherwise—that are universal and exclusive to its members, even if each member shares many properties with most other members in a “family resemblance” pattern. There would then be no shared essence that is intrinsic to members of a species. As a result, there is a wide variety of alternatives to defining what it is to be a species, what distinguishes species, and what it is for an organism to be a member of a particular species.

In this book on the metaphysics of biological classification, Michael Devitt argues that each non-microbial species has an essence that is partly “intrinsic”—composed of properties of organisms that are members of the species—and partly “historical”—dependent on the evolutionary history leading up to the species existence.^[1] These historical essences, however, also depend on past, intrinsic essences. Devitt applies similar arguments to higher biological taxa that include species as members, e.g., genera, families, orders, etc., along with what he considers to be infraspecific taxa, especially races.

Devitt argues that individual organisms have partly intrinsic and partly historical essences and is essentially a member of its taxa. There is also an interesting chapter on whether it’s metaphysically necessary that a “type specimen”—a particular organism used in the practice of defining a species or subspecies—be a member of the species for which it is a type specimen. Such organisms play important roles in the practice of biology and in some species concepts. Devitt makes it clear that some of his arguments concerning individual essences are motivated in part by an interest in justifying a version of Kripke’s essentialism (1980), but the focus of the book is not on implications for philosophy of language or areas of analytic metaphysics outside of philosophy of biology.

For those less familiar with philosophy of biology, the book may seem like a deep dive into biological classification, but the necessary background information is provided and shouldn’t overwhelm interested philosophical readers. Devitt does assume a background in basic (and occasionally a bit more than basic) concepts in analytic metaphysics, however. Accordingly—although many of the issues discussed in the book grow out of debates among biologists—the assumed philosophical background could make the book difficult for some scientists, absent a bit of targeted additional study.

The first three chapters of Biological Essentialism argue for a relatively modest, updated variety of essentialism about species and higher taxa, intended to accommodate several ideas from recent anti-essentialist views in the philosophy of biology. For example, unlike the traditional essentialism that is sometimes taken as the target of recent biological anti-essentialists, Devit’s nuanced view allows for vagueness in species boundaries and a great deal of genetic variation within species. While Devitt doesn’t discuss every variety of species concept, the book addresses quite a few and includes a great deal of clarification about what aspects of other views are or are not compatible with Devitt’s conclusions. Parts of the book are based on earlier articles, and there are many detailed responses to criticisms. I find many of Devitt’s nuanced arguments quite plausible. At the very least, his arguments illustrate the need for clarification in previous statements of alternative views.

The core of Devitt’s argument that taxa have partly intrinsic and partly historical essences is that such factors explain why a taxon’s members have traits in common. Devitt distinguishes between “structural” and “historical” explanations of organisms’ characteristics. An explanation of why genetic properties, i.e., intrinsic properties, cause nearly all Heliconius erato butterflies to develop some of the same traits is a structural explanation. An explanation of how natural selection and other evolutionary factors led up to H. erato butterflies sharing those traits is a historical explanation.^[2] Some other views take species to have historical, non-intrinisic essences, and Devitt thus incorporates some of their arguments.

These early chapters also introduce and elaborate a distinction between what Devitt calls “taxon” and “category” questions. A taxon question is a question of what defines or constitutes a particular taxon. For example, the questions of what makes a particular species that species and what makes individuals members of that species are taxon questions.

A category question is a question about the nature of a category or level in the hierarchy of taxa. The category question for species concerns what is it to be a species in general, as opposed to a genus or subspecies.^[3] Devitt uses the taxon/category question distinction repeatedly to argue that other authors have erred in conflating the two.

To take one example, the “biological species concept” (BSC) says that a species is composed of those organisms that are capable of interbreeding successfully. Devitt argues that BSC has been mistakenly considered to be a solution to the species taxon question, even though he thinks it is a possible solution to a category question. Specifically, Devitt argues that BSC doesn’t tell us anything about what makes a particular species that species. For example, South American butterflies with very different wing patterns are classified as members of the same species H. erato because they can interbreed. The same butterflies are classified as non-members of the species H. melpomene—despite sometimes having very similar wing patterns—because butterflies of these kinds cannot interbreed (Barton and Hewitt 1985). But BSC by itself can’t tell us what makes a butterfly a member of H. erato rather than H. melpomene.

Clarifying the taxon/category distinction is a valuable contribution, but sometimes Devitt seems too quick to argue that a concept that might play a role in answering a taxon question can only answer a category question. BSC, for example, can be used to define H. erato if facts about interbreeding are supplemented by reference to particular butterflies. Devitt argues that this way of defining a species is no help for explaining the common characteristics of its members. That, however, is an argument against a particular answer to a taxon problem, rather than an argument that there’s been conceptual confusion.

Devitt repeatedly qualifies claims that intrinsic factors provide structural explanations of an organism’s phenotype “given its environment” (8) or “along with some environmental factors” (18) and so on. He acknowledges that development in different environments can lead to different phenotypes and occasionally specifies that there is some particular environment with special relevance as “the appropriate environment” (33) or an organism’s “‘normal’ environment” (44). As Lewontin (Levins and Lewontin 1985) and many recent authors (e.g. Sultan 2015, Laland et al. 2015) have argued, however, environmental causes are not mere background conditions; they often play substantial, varying, interactive roles in the production of phenotypes. Devitt doesn’t explain why it is only the roles of intrinsic factors in structural explanations of phenotypes that makes them part of a taxon’s essence. He is willing to allow non-intrinsic essences: he argues that species have historical essences. The idea that environmental conditions are part of a species’ essence may seem counterintuitive, but the logic of Devitt’s argument for essences applies equally well to environmental conditions.

There’s an obvious proposal that Devitt never mentions, namely, that only inherited properties should count as essential. After all, it is upon these properties that evolutionary processes are normally thought to act. There are, however, arguments that environmental factors should sometimes be viewed as inherited and that evolutionary processes act both on properties of organisms and on their environments (e.g. Mameli 2004, Laland et al. 2015).

As I noted, Devitt’s intrinsic essentialism is compatible with a great deal of within-species genetic variability that helps to fuel anti-essentialist views. Seeing what kind of variability would conflict with Devitt’s view will help to illuminate a crucial point. In section 2.4.1, Devitt describes a case in which two species of African elephants had been thought to form a single species. New information about genetic differences between them convinced biologists that what had been thought to be a single species was in fact two. This is clearly in line with Devitt’s thinking: the two groups of elephants have significantly different intrinsic, genetic essences. Devitt reasonably holds that an essence can’t be disjunctive, as it would be if these genetically dissimilar elephants were treated as members of a single species.

In section 2.4.6, Devitt addresses arguments by some authors that there are in fact species in which a common trait has a disjunctive cause. Devitt responds that these are all examples in which a single DNA pattern causes the same phenotype to be produced in different ways rather than cases in which two different DNA patterns cause the same phenotype. Devitt takes Denis Walsh’s (2006) discussion of gene regulatory networks to illustrate this idea. Gene regulatory networks are complex causal networks of the effects of multiple genes along with other cellular elements. Part of Walsh’s point is that such networks can produce the same phenotype in response to different environmental or physiological conditions.

Devitt, however, seems to miss Walsh’s point, which is that gene regulatory networks allow organisms to produce the same phenotype despite differences in the genes available to participate in the network. This is illustrated by “developmental system drift” (DSD), which occurs when the same phenotype comes to have different genetic causes in different organisms, often because of the flexibility of gene regulatory networks (True and Haag 2001; McColgan and DiFrisco 2024). Most of the evidence for this phenomenon comes from cases in which the same trait has come to be caused by different genes in two related species. However, McGolgan and DiFrisco (2024) explain that between-species DSD would typically result from within-species DSD, and True and Haag (2001) describe evidence for cases of DSD within the same species. That is, groups that biologists routinely view as single species harbor within them disjunctive genetic causes of common phenotypes, contrary to what Devitt’s essentialism requires.

Chapters 4 and 5 concern relationships between individual organisms and their taxa. Devitt argues for a Kripke-inspired conclusion that token organisms have membership in their taxa essentially. In Chapter 4, Devitt argues that intrinsic and historical properties that are essential to a species are also essential to its members. This claim leads into Chapter 5’s discussion of some paradoxes concerning type specimens. Devitt argues, among other things, against the claim that it’s necessary that any species with a type specimen contains that type specimen.

While the first three chapters focused mostly on species and the higher taxa containing species—genera, families, etc.—Chapter 6 discusses a variety of terms used by biologists for groups within species, such as “subspecies”, “ecotype”, “variety”, and “form”. Chapter 6 suggests that arguments like those Devitt has given for species and higher taxa show that such infraspecific “taxa” have essences analogous to those of species: they are partly intrinsic, providing structural explanations of common phenotypic properties and also partly historical. Devitt is most interested in “race”, however. He notes that “race” is used by biologists, so his arguments should be applicable to races.

It is unclear, though, that biologists’ use of “race” fits Devitt’s purposes. Consider that some papers on H. erato such as Hines et al. refer to sets of butterflies that share the same wing pattern using terms like “wing-pattern races” (2011, 19666) or “color-pattern races” (ibid., 19667). This suggests that if a biologist’s research focused on another set of alternative traits in H. erato, the biologist could define other “races” that might overlap with wing-pattern races. These races might have essences in Devitt’s sense, but it would make biologists’ use of the term a poor model for a conception of a single set of races that are independent of particular research goals. I also doubt biologists would stop referring to wing-pattern races if it turned out that developmental system drift had resulted in alternative genetic bases for the same wing-pattern within a species.

I am unsure why some philosophers such as Devitt or Quayshawn Spencer (2019) think it’s important to determine whether there are biological correlates of everyday race terms used for people. Devitt spends several pages applying a series of linguistic arguments to motivate the idea that either our everyday race concepts are not social, or that if they are, it’s still reasonable to associate them with biological race concepts. If those arguments were successful, they would provide motivation for seeking biological concepts of human races. However, even Devitt doesn’t see those arguments as conclusive.

There are certainly medical contexts where biological correlates of everyday race concepts are useful, e.g. Spencer (2019), but other kinds of genetic correlations can be more useful, e.g. Haslanger (2019). Devitt correctly argues that it’s possible to use statistical analyses to divide up humans into clusters according to genetic similarity and that one well-justified way of doing this produces groups that correlate with many everyday race concepts. However, groups defined in terms of statistical patterns in genetic data need not have very much of an intrinsic essence: biologists who investigate ways of using genetic data and statistics to divide up a species into groups are not looking for genetic patterns that are universal within these groups but only for statistical “family resemblance”-style patterns.

I came to this book not as an expert or participant in the debates on which Devitt focuses but as an interested reader from another area of philosophy of biology. While I still have doubts about some of Devitt’s conclusions, I think it’s a valuable book for its numerous subtle arguments, clarifications, and challenges to other philosophical views concerning biological classification.

REFERENCES

Barton, N. H. and Hewitt, G. M. (1985). Analysis of hybrid zones. Annual Review of Ecology, Evolution, and Systematics 16 (Volume 16):113–148.

Glasgow, Jonathan; Haslanger, Sally; Jeffers, Chike; and Spencer, Quayshawn (2019). What is Race? Four Philosophical Views. Oxford University Press.

Haslanger, Sally (2019). Haslanger’s reply to Glasgow, Jeffers, and Spencer. In Glasgow et al. (2019), chap. 5, pp. 150–175.

Hines, Heather M.; Counterman, Brian A.; Papa, Riccardo; de Moura, Priscila Albuquerque; Cardoso, Marcio Z.; Linares, Mauricio; Mallet, James; Reed, Robert D.; Jiggins, Chris D.; Kronforst, Marcus R.; and McMillan, W. Owen (2011). Wing patterning gene redefines the mimetic history of Heliconius butterflies. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences 108(49):19666–19671.

Kripke, Saul A. (1980). Naming and Necessity. Havard University.

Laland, Kevin N.; Uller, Tobias; Feldman, Marcus W.; Sterelny, Kim; Müller, Gerd B.; Moczek, Armin; Jablonka, Eva; and Odling-Smee, John (2015). The extended evolutionary synthesis: its structure, assumptions and predictions. Proceedings of the Royal Society B: Biological Sciences 282(1813):20151019.

Levins, Richard and Lewontin, Richard (1985). The Dialectical Biologist. Harvard University Press.

Mameli, Matteo (2004); and Laland, et al. (2015).

Mayr, Ernst (1961). Cause and effect in biology. Science 134(3489):1501–1506.

McColgan, Áine and DiFrisco, James (2024). Understanding developmental system drift. Development 151(20):dev203054.

Spencer, Quayshawn (2019). How to be a biological race realist. In Glasgow et al. (2019), Chap. 3, pp. 73–110.

Sultan, Sonia E. (2015). Organism and Environment: Ecological Development, Niche Construction, and Adaptation. Oxford University Press.

True, John R. and Haag, Eric S. (2001). Developmental system drift and flexibility in evolutionary trajectories. Evolution & Development 3(2):109– 119.

Walsh, Denis (2006). Evolutionary essentialism. The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 57(2):425–448.