This book is the most recent entry in the Bloomsbury Introductions to World Philosophy. The twelve previously published books are uniformly excellent, and address not only the larger, often more salient, non-European traditions, but also traditions less-often studied, but rich in insight. Books in the series not only introduce philosophers to a broad range of world philosophical literature and thought, but also engage thoughtfully and critically with the tradition they address, placing that tradition in conversation with contemporary philosophy and guiding the reader’s further study. In short, this series makes it possible for any philosopher to honor the global nature of our discipline.
Stephen Harris’ exploration of Buddhist ethics through the study of Śāntideva’s Bodhicāryāvatāra (which he translates as Guide to the Practices of Awakening) is yet another glittering jewel in the Bloomsbury philosophical crown. It is precisely cut, with careful attention to canonical and secondary literature and clean articulation of arguments underpinned by meticulous philology. It is deeply colored by attention to the larger ethical and moral psychological issues Śāntideva raises. It is beautifully clear, written in an accessible prose style that makes Śāntideva’s project accessible to any reader, presupposing no background in Buddhist philosophy. And it is comprehensive, addressing Śāntideva’s system in its entirety. This volume will hence be of enormous value to ethicists who want to learn something about Buddhist ethics, to Buddhist Studies scholars who want to talk to their philosopher colleagues, and to teachers who want to address Buddhist philosophy.
Śāntideva lived in the 8th century CE. He is the most important ethical theorist in the Mahāyāna Buddhist tradition. The Guide is his principal work. It is the subject of an Indian commentary by Prajñākaramati (10th–11th century, Oldmeadow 1994) and many Tibetan commentaries (Kunzang Sonam and Duckworth 2019; Dalai Lama XIV 1988, 1994) as well as a wealth of contemporary scholarship (Cowherds 2016, Gold and Duckworth 2019 and Williams 2013). There are several good English translations available (Batchelor 1999, Crosby and Skilton 2008, Śāntideva and Padmakara Translation Group 1997, Śāntideva and Wallace and Wallace 1997; see Gómez 1999 for an excellent comparative review). Śāntideva also compiled an annotated collection of passages from other Buddhist texts to accompany the Guide, called Śikṣasamuccaya (Training Anthology, Goodman 2016a). The Guide is widely studied in Tibet and now in the West as the principal source for Mahāyāna ethics. It is composed in verse, comprising a bit over 900 stanzas, divided into 10 chapters roughly corresponding to the stages of the path to awakening outlined in the Sūtra on the Ten Grounds.
Harris has read Śāntideva’s text and the Training Anthology with great care. His intimacy with Śāntideva’s language, program, and with the text’s structure and voice is apparent. He ably contextualizes the verses, images, and arguments in the larger landscape of Buddhist scripture and doctrine, opening them to those less familiar with that background, and, in the process, offering a lesson in how to read a classical Indian text. This book will be of interest to those already immersed in this literature, and it will be invaluable to those coming to it for the first time. Harris frames his reading of the text in terms of three commitments: a virtue-theoretic account of ethics, universalism, and the centrality of ethical cultivation to personal happiness.
There are debates about how best to understand the structure of Buddhist ethical theory (Goodman and Thakchöe 2016). Some, e.g., Goodman (2008, 2009, 2016b) and Siderits (2007, 2021) have argued for a consequentialist understanding; others, such as Keown (1992) and Carpenter (2014) have defended a virtue-theoretic, or areteic reading; finally, there are those who read Buddhist ethics as moral phenomenology (Garfield 2022, Heim 2020, McCrae 2018). Harris defends an areteic analysis of Śāntideva’s program. Notably, however, Harris’ account of virtue and of its role in Śāntideva’s moral psychology—unlike those developed by Keown or Carpenter—is not Aristotelian in that it focuses on intention, rather than on dispositions. He explains:
Early Buddhist moral psychology places great importance on developing virtuous mental states which stabilize the mind and constitute progress towards liberation. . . . An important role that these virtuous mental facts play is to eliminate the afflictive mental factors which cause suffering and bind sentient beings to saṃsāra: wisdom eliminates delusion; love and compassion act as antidotes to anger, and so on.The terminology developed by these Buddhist theorists of virtue refers primarily to the mental states themselves, rather than habitual dispositions, as in a virtue theory like that of Aristotle. Compassion (karuṇā), for instance, refers to the present wish to remove sufferings. (22–23)
Harris correctly observes that even though Śāntideva’s ethical theory is Buddhist, and although it is developed in the context of that specific religious tradition, it is no more bound to that religious commitment than Kantian theory is bound to Lutheranism, or Aristotelian moral theory to paganism. That is, Śāntideva’s account of moral cultivation is predominately psychological and does not, for the most part, depend on doctrines specific to Buddhist religious traditions. As he puts it, “Śāntideva’s arguments in the Guide are universal, meant to convince all persons, regardless of religious commitment, of the truth of his moral claims” (12).
I agree with this claim, but it is worth noting that to establish it requires some careful discussion of the role of the Buddhist cosmology of rebirth, the doctrine of karma, and the discussion of the multiple realms of existence, including hell realms, heavens, lives as hungry spirits or deities, etc., and Harris does not undertake that work. One could, for instance, naturalize Śāntideva’s discourse in some way or other, by reading it as metaphorical, as psychological, as guides to visualization exercises, etc. (Garfield 2015, 2022). But Harris eschews naturalization, writing that he does “not present a naturalized version of Śāntideva’s thought. . . . This is because appeals to karmic causality and its results in future lives provide important premises he incorporates repeatedly into his arguments” (16). Since Harris does interpret Śāntideva on karma and rebirth non-naturalistically and believes that these accounts are central to Śāntideva’s project, it is not clear how he intends to accommodate these ideas alongside his commitment to universalism. This is an unfortunate lacuna in an otherwise satisfying exposition.
A final idea that frames Harris’ interpretation of Śāntideva—one that is clearly correct, and unappreciated—is that the universal altruism and the attitudes of kindness, care, impartiality, and joy in the accomplishments of others that Śāntideva recommends do not constitute self-sacrifice or self-abnegation. Instead, Harris demonstrates that, on Śāntideva’s view, they are both constitutive of and instrumental to human happiness (40 ff., 60 ff.). So, when Śāntideva compares pleasure in the everyday world to honey on a razor blade, he is pointing out that the pursuit of our own pleasure in the end yields only pain, because of the attachment it generates to a fragile commodity; when Śāntideva argues that we only become happy when we dedicate ourselves to the welfare of others, the freedom from attachment to our own narrow interest expands our sources of joy. As Harris puts it, “Perfect giving, for Śāntideva, is private, but other-focused; self-benefitting, but radically benevolent; total, and yet not self-injurious” (67).
Harris thus frames Śāntideva’s text as a guide to escaping from the suffering of ordinary life by cultivating virtue, grounded in the insight that we succeed in advancing our own true interests only by detaching ourselves from apparent narrow self-interest and from a concern with the immediate present in favor of a longer and broader moral vision. This reading opens the text beautifully, and it helps the reader to unpack Śāntideva’s arguments.
Most of this framework is laid out in the introduction. The first full chapter addresses the question of the relationship between ethics and the Madhyamaka Buddhist doctrine of the emptiness of all phenomena. One might think that if everything is empty of intrinsic reality, and exists only conventionally, then ethical principles are unimportant—just matters of custom, with no normative force (Williams 2013). Harris addresses this issue carefully, explaining that emptiness is not non-existence, but interdependence; the absence of intrinsic nature. To say that everything is empty is therefore not to say that nothing really exists, but to say that everything that does exist does so in a network of causal, mereological, and conceptual interdependence. This is what makes it possible for us to be agents and patients, and this is why what we do matters. Emptiness is therefore not an underminer, but the necessary condition of ethical engagement. Śāntideva presents these arguments in the ninth chapter; Harris is wise to rehearse them at the outset before returning to them at the end, as anyone reading this text in a Buddhist context would be aware of these points as they are made by Nāgārjuna (2nd C CE) and by Candrakīrti (7th C CE), on whose work Śāntideva relies.
The subsequent chapters are arranged roughly in the order of a list of six virtues (or perfections) that are cultivated at each of the successive stages of attainment on the path to awakening, and they follow the structure of the Guide. Those virtues are generosity, mindfulness, patience, commitment, meditation, and wisdom. (This is another point at which it would be useful to address the universality question: if the path to awakening is an essential aspect of the architecture of the view, universality requires us to abstract that path from specifically Buddhist doctrine. Once again, while that may be possible, Harris does not address this problem.)
Harris devotes a full chapter to generosity, a virtue to which Śāntideva surprisingly devotes only cursory attention. Harris explains the structure and importance of generosity to Buddhist ethics in welcome detail. His discussion of the conceptual relation between giving and the abandonment of self and attachment is packed with insight and takes us deeper into this discussion than any other contemporary discussion. It is enriched considerably by his attention to the subtle Sanskrit wordplay that Śāntideva uses to bring this out, once again demonstrating the philosophical value of very close reading grounded in superb philology (52–54). This is followed by an excellent chapter on patience, with a nuanced discussion of Śāntideva’s critique of anger.
Harris (like almost everyone else who writes about this text, lamentably), skips over the 7th chapter on commitment (vīrya) and goes right from the 6th chapter to the very complex 8th chapter. This is the chapter that has evolved the most as the text achieved its final form, and many have questioned its coherence. In two superb chapters, Harris shows masterfully how it all hangs together, justifying reliance on the settled version of the text instead of the earlier drafts. The translation, exegesis, and reconstruction of the arguments is precise, with adequate attention to other relevant secondary literature. Harris explains and ably motivates both Śāntideva’s account of the relation between moral cultivation and happiness and his arguments to the conclusion that the moral orientation he advances is the only rational comportment to the world.
The final chapters of Harris’ volume address the two final chapters of the Guide—the chapter on wisdom and the chapter on the resolve to assist all beings to awaken. The ninth chapter of the Guide is notoriously difficult, with a great deal of very telegraphic scholastic debate that can only be really understood with the assistance of commentary, and which presupposes a strong background in medieval Indian philosophy, both Buddhist and non-Buddhist. Harris wisely spares the reader a journey into those weeds. Those who wish to dive into that material should read Douglas Duckworth’s translation of Kunzang Sonam’s (1823–1905) commentary on that chapter, or the Dalai Lama XIV’s commentary (Kunzang Sonam and Duckworth 2019; Dalai Lama XIV 1988). Instead he focuses appropriately on the discussion in this chapter on the relation between emptiness, interdependence, and moral experience, closing the loop that began with the framing in the introduction. The exposition is precise and lucid. The final chapter addresses the vast scope of the ethical motivation Śāntideva inspires, and Harris draws some nice connections between Śāntideva’s program and contemporary ethical theory.
Harris’ discussions are always tied closely to the text, are always philosophically sophisticated, and grounded in excellent translations. There is nothing tendentious in this presentation, and the insights Harris develops are often revelatory. His account does raise some questions, though, in addition to that concerning universalism noted above. I pose these questions not to criticize his approach, but rather to suggest some other ways to look at the text, in the spirt of conversation, not of disputation.
First, there is a matter of how to represent the structure of the Guide. Harris notes two important structural principles that guide Śāntideva’s composition: the first, as noted above, is the structure of the bodhisattva path while the second is the format of a Mahāyāna sadhana, or worship ritual (see Huntington 2019). (46) He is absolutely correct that each of these is an important organizing principle: Śāntideva follows the ten grounds and six perfections format exactly, and the structure of the text maps directly on to the structure of a sadhana.
But there are three other principles at work as well, and part of the brilliance of the text is that it maps on to all five of these axes. One is the iconography of the Wheel of Existence (Bhavacakra) that indicates how the fear for death enframes the cycling from ethical mood to ethical mood driven by the three fundamental psychopathologies of attraction, aversion, and confusion, and suggests that moral cultivation is a transition from fear to confidence. Another is the framework deriving from the distinction between the three intentional objects of care or compassion (karuṇā) set out in the opening verses of Candrakīrti’s Introduction to the Middle Way: sentient beings regarded as suffering; sentient beings regarded as impermanent; sentient beings regarded as empty of intrinsic identity. The Guide also moves through these three characterizations (Jenkins 2016).
Finally, in chapter 1 of the Guide, Śāntideva distinguishes between aspirational and engaged bodhicitta (aspiration to awaken). The former he characterizes as like knowing about a place through reading a guidebook; the latter is like the kind of knowledge one gains from going there. The content may be the same, but the force and depth of the knowledge is very different, reflecting the difference between testimony or inference and perception. The Guide also takes the reader from aspirational to engaged bodhicitta, allowing us first to understand, and then to come to see the world through its framework (Garfield 2019). I would have liked to have seen Harris deploy all of these frameworks; taken together they give a rich sense of the structure of ethical cultivation, and they reveal the full complexity of this poetic exposition.
Harris’ defense of his virtue approach as opposed to the moral phenomenology approach also raises some interesting questions. Is moral cultivation primarily the development of ways of experiencing the world (moral phenomenology) or is it primarily the development of virtues (once again, understood as intentions)? In the end, it may be that the distinction at issue is more one of emphasis than of content. But despite the fact that Harris comes down in favor of virtue, it appears that he offers many strong arguments for the phenomenological position.
Consider the following statements that Harris makes in explaining the content of Śāntideva’s account:
The pathological emotions are targeted as the chief obstacles. (30)A. . . source of disvalue is the psychological suffering which is either constituted by or results from the pathological emotions. (32)
Saṃvega is the affective awareness that there is no lasting happiness to be found in saṃsāric pursuits. (81)
Just as we experience mental pain and become angry when we are physically harmed, sentient beings also enrage us by insults. . . Śāntideva [also argues that we] should not be distressed. (84)
Śāntideva’s method in chapter 6 is also phenomenological in important respects . . . . [He] portrays patience as the rational response to a fragmented but interconnected world. We falsely perceive transient phenomena as able to provide lasting satisfaction and suffer terribly when our desires are frustrated. The solution is not to alter the fundamental nature of the world. . . but to transform self-centered grasping into deep concern. (101)
[T]he bodhisattva imaginatively takes up the standpoint of others. (105)
This quartet of verses develops a contrast between the impoverished pursuit of sensual enjoyments, and the stable joy experienced while performing virtuous actions. (152)
Each of these sounds like a description of a transformation of a way of perceiving; none of them describe intentions.
Chapter 6 of Harris’ book is even titled “Wisdom and the Transformation of Experience,” and is devoted to showing how a direct understanding of emptiness is important precisely because it transforms both our cognitive and affective experience of others and of ourselves: “At the level of experience, the bodhisattva developed in wisdom engages with conventionally existent persons who remain the objects of his compassion but are no longer reified as intrinsically existent. The object of awareness therefore remains the same, but the mode in which the bodhisattva experiences them changes” (167). “Śāntideva’s choice to use the four foundations for mindfulness as objects of metaphysical analysis hints at his experiential focus in this chapter” (171). In each of these cases, Harris seems to be endorsing a phenomenological, not a virtue reading, and in each case he does so for good reason. So, Harris himself suggests that the phenomenological reading is a good reading, and this makes one wonder why he rejects it.
This is a very fine book. Those coming to Buddhist ethics, or to Śāntideva’s texts for the first time—whether as students or as philosophers new to this area—will find it a lucid and reliable guide to the Guide. Scholars who are deeply conversant with this material will find a trove of new insights, translation ideas, and interpretations. I encourage anyone with an interest in Buddhist philosophy, ethics, or cross-cultural philosophy to read this book, and anyone without an interest in these areas to cultivate an interest by reading this book. Only those who fall into neither camp can safely ignore it.
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