Dan Baras’s excellent book investigates the phenomenon that some facts seem to be striking or to call out for explanationmore than others. As Baras discusses (section 1.1), this phenomenon plays a central role in arguments across philosophy. For example, fine-tuning arguments for theism often involve the claim that the hospitability of the universe to life stands in need of explanation and arguments against mathematical platonism stress that the striking correlation between our mathematical beliefs and the mathematical truths demands explanation.
It’s not just philosophy. Here is an example from scientific practice—in particular, cosmology—that I think illustrates the importance of the phenomenon.[1]
Consider the cosmic microwave background radiation (CMB)—radiation that is ‘left over’ from the Big Bang. Interestingly, the temperature of the CMB is almost exactly the same wherever we look in the universe—specifically, it’s 2.725 K. This observation was a problem for the version of Big Bang theory that was standard in the 1960s and 1970s since it could not give a satisfying explanation of this uniformity. The problem is that there are regions of the universe where the CMB is the same temperature but which are so far apart that they could never have interacted with each other (given that physical processes can’t propagate faster than the speed of light)—so normal processes of thermal equilibration can’t be at work. The best explanation that such theories can give is to postulate a highly specific, seemingly fine-tuned, set of initial conditions that lead to this uniformity.
This problem was a major part of the motivation for an alternative—Inflationary Big Bang theories—which can more satisfyingly explain the uniformity. Importantly, the problem wasn’t merely that non-inflationary theories couldn’t satisfyingly explain the distribution of temperature—if the distribution was random-looking that wouldn’t have been a problem. The problem was that they couldn’t give a satisfying explanation of the distribution of temperature, and that the distribution is uniform. It is this uniformity that is taken to be ‘disturbing’ and a ‘profound problem’ for non-inflationary theories (Dodelson 2003, 143).
In this case, and in many others, we see that some facts seem to call out for explanation more than others. And when they do, we want a special type of explanation—we are not satisfied with explaining the uniformity of the CMB by appealing to the particular initial conditions that just happened to hold.
Baras’s topic, then, has great philosophical and scientific importance. And his investigation of it is superb. In particular, the detail and precision with which he clarifies the phenomenon at issue and investigates potential accounts is extremely impressive. Normally books that exhibit these virtues come out of an already mature literature on the topic, which the book synthesizes and develops. Not so for Baras’s book. The literature on when facts call out for explanation is sparse, and the work there is on the topic is spread out across a variety of areas. Baras’s book is, to my knowledge, the first direct, sustained, investigation of the issue. This makes the work even more valuable.
The core of the book argues against the naive picture of strikingness, which Baras describes as follows:
It is as if facts are painted by different colors—those painted black call for explanation, and those painted gray do not. . .When we come across a fact that calls for explanation, we infer that its explanation. . .must be of a special kind; for other facts, we make no such inference. (33)
For example, the uniformity of the CMB is striking and should be given a special type of explanation, not so for a random-looking distribution of temperature. 100 coin tosses all landing heads is striking and should be given a special type of explanation, but not so for the sequence HTHHHTHHHTTTTH. . .
Instead, Baras endorses eliminativism about strikingness. The book starts as follows:
In this chapter, I will introduce an idea and argue that everybody should care about it. The conclusion of the book will be that everybody should forget about this same idea. (1)
The overall argumentative structure is roughly as follows: The naive picture invites two main questions:
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- What is the property of strikingness?
- What is the special type of explanation that a striking explanation calls for?
In chapters 3 and 4 Baras considers lots of possible answers to questions 1 and 2. He raises interesting and powerful objections to those answers and concludes, with respect to both questions, that there is no ‘unified’ answer. The project of answering these questions ‘reaches a dead end’ (34). On the basis of this he claims that there is no ‘metaphysically substantial property’ (159) of strikingness. And this motivates his eliminativism. (Baras also suggests that there are pragmatic reasons to forget about strikingness—our inquiry goes better without it. But this is downstream of the main concern that strikingness is not a substantial property.)
This argument is augmented with arguments, mainly in chapter 5, that we can make sense of how we should reason about apparently striking facts without appealing to what he calls the Striking Principle—the principle that tells us to infer from a fact’s strikingness to its needing a special explanation. Rather, we can ‘appeal to other, better-established principles, such as Bayesian principles and enumerative induction’ (126).
The discussion in these chapters is rich and extremely illuminating. Nevertheless, I have my doubts about both the ‘dead end’ argument and the arguments that we can make do without inferences about strikingness.
Let’s start with the latter. Baras thinks in many cases of apparently striking facts what’s really going on is simple enumerative induction, along with standard Bayesian reasoning. For example, consider a long alternating sequence of coin tosses, HTHTHTHTHTHTHT. . . . I think that this striking fact can’t just be a fluke—there must be some substantial explanation for it. Baras agrees, but thinks that strikingness doesn’t really play a role here; rather I’m inferring from past experience.
There’s something initially puzzling about this suggestion since I, personally, have never observed such a long alternating pattern, and every sequence of coin tosses I have experienced has been, I think, just due to chance. No one has ever tried to trick me with a double-headed coin or anything like that. But Baras thinks that I do have relevant experience—in particular the experience that ‘simple patterns are often produced by natural constraints, and human manipulations tend to produce things that are significant to us’ (130).
One initial concern is that lots of simple patterns I’ve seen have been due to chance—like every simple pattern of coin tosses I’ve ever experienced. And the concepts of ‘simple pattern’, ‘significant’, ‘natural constraints’ and so on are rather fuzzy. So, it’s not obvious to me how easy it is to perform the enumerative induction and whether it can indeed make us very confident that the alternating pattern has a substantial explanation.
But more importantly, this reasoning has the whiff of bootstrapping to me. Imagine, analogously, that I tried to argue that the history of science gives us inductive evidence that simpler theories are likely to be true, so there isn’t an independent role for simplicity to play in our methodology—it reduces to enumerative induction. A natural objection is that we haven’t observed lots of past cases where the simpler scientific theory turned out to be true. Rather, we have observed lots of past cases where we have come to the conclusion that the simpler theory is true. But if our past scientific methodology for determining which theory is true involves favoring simpler theories then we can’t appeal to that track record to show that our reasoning about simplicity stems from induction.
I have similar concerns about Baras’s suggestion. Our scientific track record for determining which theories are true seems to me to be already infected by judgements of strikingness, as we see in the CMB case. So, I have my doubts about whether the appeal to induction can do what Baras wants it to.
In other cases, Baras wants to explain away an intuitive appeal to strikingness without using induction. For example:
Poetry: Suppose we discover a method of magnifying subatomic particles such that we can discover their precise shapes. Using this method, we discover that on every single particle, there appears a beautiful poem in a familiar language. (137)
This fact clearly calls out for explanation but the case is so strange that ‘there seem to be insufficient observations to justify prior probabilities for possible hypotheses’ (135); so, induction can’t be the key here.
Relatedly, he discusses striking mathematical facts (section 5.3), like those discussed in Lange (2010), which seems to call out for explanation. Again, Baras doubts that enumerative induction can be the full story here.
With respect to both these cases Baras admits that he doesn’t have a full story about why we reason as we do, and why we are so confident that we need an explanation. But in both cases he thinks that doesn’t justify believing that strikingness plays an indispensable epistemic role. For example, with respect to the mathematical cases he says:
I don’t really know what to say here. But I also don’t think that the fact that I don’t know what exactly to say is reason to believe that the striking principle is needed. Inferring from the fact that there are expectations about explanations that seem justified and we don’t quite know how to justify them to the conclusion that the striking principle is a privileged principle of reasoning would be like inferring from the fact that there are many things that scientists do not know how to explain naturalistically to the conclusion that a supernatural god exists. Both are unjustified logical leaps. (142-3)
Fair enough. But such issues invite questions about the other part of his argument—that the project of answering questions 1 and 2 has met a dead end. His argument is, in effect, an argument by elimination. He considers lots of possible answers to questions 1 and 2, and raises interesting objections to them.
As we have just seen, though, Baras’s account faces challenges too—challenges which, at least to me, appear to be similarly strong to those raised against other views. This tells us something about the overall structure of the argument. Baras’s criticism of alternative views is not just a way of giving an initial motivation for his account, which he then argues is superior. Rather, Baras seems to be arguing that none of these alternative approaches to strikingness can possibly work, so that eliminativism has to be right, even though it itself faces problem cases. Eliminativism is the default fallback position.
Convincingly arguing for eliminativism about a philosophical concept in this way is a rather tall order. Arguments that purport to rule out a certain type of account of a concept are rarely conclusive and Baras considers so many possible accounts. In chapter 3 alone he considers and rejects eleven possible accounts of strikingness—ranging from simple probabilistic accounts to accounts that tie strikingness to significance or the appearance of authorship, and even primitivist accounts. Some of his arguments seem very compelling—like the argument that the strikingness of a fact has little to do with it being low probability. But in other cases Baras’s arguments seem more like invitations for defenders of an account to say more rather than reasons to rule out an account.
For example, Baras criticizes the view that ‘A fact calls for explanation because and to the extent that it has objective significance’ (97) by noting, firstly, that it’s not clear what type of significance is meant to be at work here and, secondly, that if we restrict to ‘moral significance’ then the account faces some apparent counterexamples. This seems right to me, but Baras’s own work (Baras and Na’aman 2022) on the concept of surprisingness and its connection to significance provides many more resources that his opponent can appeal to here.
More generally, the history of philosophy should make us rather doubtful of arguments for eliminativism that take this structure. If we rejected philosophical concepts because all the accounts we can think of face substantial problems then we might not be left with very much!
Of course, eliminativism is more natural with respect to some concepts that others—some are more deeply entrenched in our thinking than others. But strikingness is, I think, pretty deeply entrenched. It’s entrenched, as I see it, in our broadly explanationist reasoning about the world—for example, Inference to the Best Explanation. (Baras discusses, but puts aside, such thoughts in section 2.2.) When we perform IBE we, in Peter Lipton’s (2004) terminology, consider a variety of alternative hypotheses and consider which one would be the loveliest explanation of the data. A lot goes into our judgements of loveliness—we have to consider how those hypotheses exhibit a range of theoretical virtues. But part of our judgments of loveliness is the idea that some parts of the data are more important to explain than others. It’s hard for me to see how to understand the CMB case without that—any lovely explanation of the data must give the uniformity of the CMB a substantial explanation. And it’s hard for me to see how to understand this aspect of explanationist reasoning in terms of other epistemic principles like Bayesianism or enumerative induction. Explanationist reasoning strikes me as an irreducible part of our methodology for investigating the world and judging that some facts call out for explanation more than others is a central part of that.
Even though I’m ultimately unconvinced by Baras’s eliminativism, the work he does throughout the book—in mapping out the concept of strikingness; identifying possible accounts; and zeroing in on the key issues those accounts face—is superb. The literature on strikingness will be based around this book for a long time. Hopefully it can avoid a dead end.
REFERENCES
Baras, Dan, and Oded Na’aman. 2022. “What Makes Something Surprising?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 105 (1): 195–215.
Dodelson, Scott. 2003. Modern Cosmology. Elsevier.
Guth, Alan, and Paul Steinhardt. 1989. “The Inflationary Universe.” In The New Physics, edited by P Davies.
Lange, Marc. 2010. “What Are Mathematical Coincidences (and Why Does It Matter).” Mind; a Quarterly Review of Psychology and Philosophy 119 (474): 307–40.
Lipton, Peter. 2004. Inference to the Best Explanation. Vol. 102. Routledge/Taylor; Francis Group.
[1] My discussion of the physics here broadly follows Guth and Steinhardt (1989).