The revival of interest in Cicero’s philosophical writings continues to demonstrate its vigour. Hot on the heels of The Cambridge Companion to Cicero’s Philosophy (2022) have come two collective volumes offering treatments of his final philosophical composition, De Officiis (often Anglicised as ‘On Duties’), a guide to practical ethics which proved hugely influential right through to the end of the eighteenth century. In 2023, Cambridge University Press published Cicero’s De Officiis: A Critical Guide (edited by Raphael Woolf), a sequence of reflective essays on various themes in the work. Now from De Gruyter we have a similar set of studies.
After a good introduction by the two editors, there follow chapters on the prefaces with which Cicero himself introduces each of the three books of De Officiis (by Marco Bleistein), and on the continued commitment to a stance of Academic scepticism that he reaffirms in them, despite the overall Stoic cast of their content (Georgia Tsouni). Four studies are then offered of the long foundational Book I, in which Cicero presents his account of virtue and the cardinal virtues (authors: Jula Wildberger, Christoph Horn, Jørn Müller, David Machek). The shorter Book 2, on the pursuit of advantage, is discussed by Dorothea Frede and Stefan Röttig. Themes from Book 3, on the apparent conflict between the virtuous or honourable and the advantageous course of action, are entrusted to Tue Emil Öhler Søvsø and Rebecca Langlands. The collection is rounded off by the masterly treatment of the political theory of De Officiis that one would expect from Jed Atkins, and by an interesting study from Phillipp Brüllmann of the very differing, but in some ways not dissimilar, reactions to Cicero’s conceptualisation of duty on the part of St Ambrose of Milan, on the one hand, and of Kant, on the other. Bibliographical references are appended to each of the chapters, but there is a concluding consolidated bibliography also, as well as indexes of topics and persons. In every chapter, cross-references to other chapters are supplied by the editors at appropriate points. Even more such references might have been usefully supplied. On ‘instrumentalisation’ of virtue in De Officiis, for example, very different views are taken by Horn and Frede, on whose essay I comment below.
Tsouni, Langlands, and Atkins write in English, all three as it happens having made appearances on closely related topics in Woolf’s Cambridge Critical Guide. Otherwise, the book is in German, and explicitly designed to fill a gap in the German philosophical literature. Sadly, this might limit the likely readership, for reasons all too familiar, even though as the AI revolution gathers pace, instant translation capacity improves all the time. It would be a pity for anyone seriously interested in coming to terms with De Officiis to miss the stimulus this volume can offer. There is something worth thinking about in each of its component essays. Some may provoke controversy of various kinds. I have space only to touch on one general issue raised in these studies.
While De Officiis offers the reader a basically Stoic ethic, the embodiment of virtue it recommends is not the perfectly wise Stoic sage, but the more accessible figure of the vir bonus, the good man as conceived by Roman jurists, who exemplifies above all the social virtue of justice, ‘the queen of all the virtues’ (as Book 3 puts it). More specifically, what Cicero presents is a practical ethic appropriate for his son Marcus, formal addressee of De Officiis, and de facto for other young Romans poised to enter public life. The literary model he will follow in doing so—not word for word, he tells us—is a treatise by the second century BCE Greek Stoic Panaetius, which has now been lost. But Panaetius, despite a declared intention to do so, never composed a treatment of Cicero’s third topic, namely, the possibility of conflict between the claims of virtue and considerations of advantage. So Book 3 had to be constructed without reliance on any other single model, since Cicero apparently felt that nothing relevant by anyone else quite suited his needs.
How much of De Officiis is Stoicism of any stripe, and how much is Cicero’s own impregnation of Stoicism with Roman cultural assumptions? The editors’ own stance, as set out in their introduction, occupies a judicious middle ground between discerning Panaetius’s footprints in much of the detail as well as the general structure of Cicero’s discussions, and finding few concrete signs of them, particularly where examples are drawn from Roman politics and history. Not—to complicate matters further—that Panaetius’s treatise could not have had its own Roman dimensions. He spent many years in Rome, where he was clearly something of a draw for some of the more intellectually inclined among the elite, and may well have written with that readership in mind.
Some of the contributors argue for Cicero’s own strong imprint in some of the material he presents. Notable instances are Müller’s assessment of magnitudo animi, ‘great and elevated spirit’, as a specifically Roman virtue, in one of the most rewarding chapters in the collection; Langlands’ richly illuminating study of the use of moral examples in ethical method in Book 3; and Tsouni’s bold diagnosis of an Academic sceptic approach to problem cases in that same book. Other chapters reflect confidence that Cicero does mostly stick close to his Panaetian model. Few scholars would be inclined to doubt that anyway for his initial account of natural impulse and the virtues at the beginning of Book 1, discussed in a strong contribution by Wildberger. Likewise, there are probably few who would want to question the attribution of the theory of four personae presented later in Book 1 to Panaetius: roles dictated both by universal human tendencies and by those special to each individual (both sorts of tendency conceived as natural endowments), and roles we find ourselves playing either by circumstance or by choice. How far the details of Cicero’s account are similarly Panaetian seems more debatable.
Machek, in the chapter devoted to the topic, seems to think the treatment of Cicero’s star example of the second persona, his contemporary Cato’s gravitas (‘seriousness of weighty purpose’), aptly captures Panaetius’s thinking. Presumably because it is with the first persona that Cicero associates ‘everything honourable’ (i.e., virtuous), Machek supposes that gravitas here can only be conceptualised as what the Stoics deemed ‘indifferent’, not ‘better’ than (for example) equanimity. However, when Cicero talks in this context of pursuits superior to those natural to someone’s individual persona, he does speak of these as ‘weightier (graviora) and better’: which suggests that gravitas is conceived of as a virtue here (as generally and frequently in Cicero’s writings), even if it is a virtue that is not the perfection of a universal human impulse. Moreover, if in the characterisation of such pursuits as ‘better’ (meliora) Cicero were faithful to Panaetius’s own treatment of this second persona, Machek’s further suggestion that the Panaetian theory ‘implies an anti-elitist agenda’ would look somewhat optimistic (as well as suspiciously close to contemporary Western liberal ideology).
The pursuit of glory is the key focus of a major section of Book 2. This might well be thought very much a distinctively Ciceronian preoccupation. Indeed Frede, in introducing the topic, suggests that one might suppose its prominence is due to Cicero’s obsession with his own public standing. But she counters that it is rather Panaetius who is ‘father of this line of thinking’. When Frede gets more specific, she writes that honour and glory are presented here as proven means for ensuring good will, trust, and admiration. As I read the main emphasis of Cicero’s argument, it is the other way around: winning these responses is rather the means whereby glory is achieved (as summarised at Off. 2.38). In any case, whereas it is comparatively easy to make the case that he was replicating Panaetius’s treatise in arguing for the political advantages—‘improvement in prospects (augendum) and esteem (honestandum)’ (Off. 2.21)—of gaining good will, trust, and admiration, it is harder to guess whether Panaetius had spoken of something in that context which Cicero would have felt naturally Latinised as gloria. What we do know is that Cicero himself had a keen interest in the impact of the pursuit of glory on the conduct of politics and the state of society. Shortly before writing De Officiis, he had himself in the summer of 44 BCE composed a work on glory in two books (unfortunately lost), to which he refers here (Off. 2.31). Moreover, insistence on the difference between true and false glory was a longstanding theme of his.
Earlier in Frede’s chapter is a discussion of what she calls the ‘instrumentalisation’ of the virtues in Book 2. The instrumentalisation of the virtues was a charge the Stoics levelled against the Epicureans, with reason—if we may trust the treatment of the virtues ascribed to them at Fin. 1.42-54, and caricatured by Cleanthes in his image of Epicurean pleasure enthroned as queen and surrounded by the virtues as her handmaids (Fin. 2.69). As Cicero presents their view, they held that the four cardinal virtues are desirable not in themselves, but only because they produce pleasures or protect against pains. But that is not the novel kind of instrumentalisation Frede is attributing to Cicero. She cites particularly a passage early in the book where he says he counts it as ‘the special property of virtue to win over the hearts and minds of people’, and that the ‘enthusiastic support of people, ready and willing to further our interests, is inspired by the wisdom and virtue of outstanding men’ (Off. 2.17). As she observes, the main focus in Book 2 is on the effect virtue, particularly justice, has on people whose support a politician might hope to enlist. From the vantage point of such a political agent, what is at stake here is not so much the attractiveness of virtue itself, but the advantage of recognition and gratitude achievable by its exercise.
That, if I do not misinterpret her, is what Frede has in mind in talking here of the instrumentalisation of the virtues. It is not that in Cicero’s conception the value of the virtues in themselves is instrumental (as the Epicureans held). It is rather that (as he puts the upshot of his train of argument on the pursuit of glory at Off. 2.42–3): ‘So anyone who wishes to acquire true glory must discharge the obligations of justice.’ The emphasis is on the usefulness of virtue for such a pursuit, or more specifically of the recognition and gratitude it inspires. Such an approach to virtue is the sort of thing one might expect, Frede suggests, when Stoicism turned its attention from the sage to people not in a position to grasp infallibly what is truly good, as with Panaetius it did shift its focus. Such people are, however, capable of action appropriate to a given situation (on the Stoic conception of the natural scheme of things), that will command the approval of their peers. A practical ethic of this kind could be expected to have appealed to Cicero when composing De Officiis for the readership of the young aspiring politicians that he was targeting.
Whether that ethic is best captured by the notion of the instrumentalisation of the virtues is another matter. After all, Book 2 is paired with and subordinate to Book 1. Cicero might have been happier to have its message characterised as ‘the moralisation of advantage’. The theme that Book 3 will reiterate again and again is captured in such terms as these (Off. 3.101): ‘We all seek what is useful, we are pulled towards it, we can do nothing else. . . . But we can never find anything useful except in what is praiseworthy, fitting, and honourable. We therefore regard these as our primary and highest values, and consider the word “usefulness” not so much splendid as just a necessity.’