After a 15-yearlong lull, philosophical interest in concepts is picking up again: old questions are litigated de novo (e.g., Laurence and Margolis, 2024), and new questions are investigated (e.g., Dove, 2022; McCaffrey, in press). Shea’s Concepts at the Interface is a major contribution to this renewed discussion. As one has come to expect from him, the book is crystal clear and engaging; it moves seamlessly from careful philosophical arguments to sophisticated and well-informed empirical discussions, which bring together cognitive science, neuroscience, and machine learning. Shea’s goal is, explicitly, less to argue for specific claims about the mind than to paint a big picture about the architecture of human cognition—what forms of thinking make up human cognition, what the basic mechanisms and processes are, and how they are organized—and to highlight the role of what he calls “concepts” in it—what form of thinking concepts are involved in, how they are connected to forms of thinking, and how they feature in the mind’s basic mechanisms and processes. The book covers a lot of territory, from the nature of structured thoughts (Chapter 2), to computation (Chapter 3), to the role of meaning in mind (Chapter 7), to metacognition (Chapter 8). Each of the nine chapters ends up with a succinct summary of its content.
Like many philosophers these days, Shea takes concepts to be mental representations instead of abstract entities and begins from a familiar starting point (Chapter 1): While human thinking takes many forms (e.g., we can think by manipulating visual images), it also involves a kind of thinking “undoubtedly unique to humans” (1), which he calls “reasoning”. Reasoning involves formal, content-insensitive inferences: that is, inferences that are determined by the form of thoughts rather than by their content (they are maximally “content-independent”). (Shea also leaves room for material inferences in reasoning.) Reasoning takes place in steps, it is limited, and it requires attentional effort. Crucially, reasoning is only possible because thoughts involved in reasoning have a language-like nature.
While Shea does not commit himself to the language-of-thought hypothesis, his account requires the thoughts involved in reasoning to have a syntax, which allows for predication, negation, and conditional reasoning. So, on his view, thoughts involved in reasoning have a compositional structure: they have a principled decomposition into elements. Concepts are these elements, which, when combined appropriately, make up thoughts. Concepts can be combined productively, exactly as words do, allowing for new complex concepts or new thoughts.
What distinguishes Shea’s approach to concepts is the proposal that concepts have, so to speak, a double life (Chapters 1 and 5): They are not only the elements of thoughts, but they are also connected to further representational structures, which can be used in non-propositional forms of thinking such as visual imagery, simulations of actions, orientation, etc. Shea calls these representational structures “informational models” and these episodes of thought “simulations”. As he puts it: “A concept provides access to a rich body of information about its subject matter” (122). (A “body of information” in Shea’s terminology includes several informational models.) New complex concepts can trigger original simulations, which allow us to investigate new possibilities in thought, using multimodal and amodal information.
Chapter 4 examines the diversity of the informational models connected to concepts. They range from systems that encode information implicitly such as “special-purpose perceptual processing, model-free reinforcement learning, and motor control” (91) to structural representations such as cognitive maps to bodies of beliefs (“stored semantic memories”), such as prototypes or what psychologists call “theories.”
Chapter 5, the most original chapter of the book, examines how concepts access and manipulate these informational models for thinking. It also compares Shea’s views to others. Shea does not identify concepts with the explicit, belief-involving informational models, in explicit contrast to my own approach (Machery, 2009; 2015). Rather, concepts are “temporary representations in working memory” (124); they are “working memory labels” (125) that refer to something (cat refers to cats) and that point to informational models (cat points to informational models about cats). He also distinguishes his understanding of concepts as “labels” from Eliasmith’s (e.g., Blouw et al., 2016) and Quilty-Dunn’s (2021) views that concepts are “pointers”.
Finally, Shea proposes a new, ingenious theory of concept individuation. First, for a given individual, an informational model is identified by its persistence (see also Machery, 2010): Despite constant changes in which information is included, it remains the same informational model because of the temporal connection between its past and present states. Labels in working memory across occurrences are the same concept, not because they fall under the same vehicle type as one might have thought (viz. labels that are different qua vehicles can be the same concept), but because they are connected to persistent informational models.
Chapter 5 brims with new ideas, but there are some issues with the whole picture. The most puzzling one is the nature of the labeling relation between a concept and its informational models. As Shea himself acknowledges, the informational models connected to a concept are diverse, and different occurrences of the same concept can cause the manipulation of different informational models (visual imagery on one occasion, a prototype on another). What does it mean for these two token concepts to be connected to the same set of informational models, and thus, on his view, to count as the same concept? Since, as we just saw, it isn’t that they cause the use of the same informational model, it must be a dispositional property: Each occurrence of a concept can cause the manipulation of any of the informational models associated with this concept. But an occurrence of a concept can also cause the manipulation of many different things: Thinking about cats can make me think about poetry, for instance.
So, what distinguishes the relation between the concept cat and my visual imagery of cats from its relation to my emotions about, and knowledge of, poetry? If there is no difference, then why isn’t the latter part of the informational models associated with cat? And if relation to my emotions about, and knowledge of, poetry is included in these informational models, it would seem that everything gets to be included in the informational models to which a concept is connected, and it is misleading to say that a concept is a label for a particular set of informational models. It wouldn’t do to reply that my emotions about, and knowledge of, poetry are not part of the informational models associated with cats because they are not about cats.
What does it mean for an information model to be about cats? It cannot mean “information that is relevant for thinking about cats” because anything could be so relevant. Nor do informational models have genuine referential properties: What does it mean to say that a motor program related to cats is about cats? Another issue is that Shea’s concept individuation is in tension with the claim that reasoning proceeds formally (Chapter 1): If reasoning is formal, then concepts must be individuated by intrinsic, syntactic properties, and not by a relational property such as their pointing to persistent informational models. A possible response is that concepts fall under the same vehicle type within, but not across, episodes of reasoning (thanks to Shea for the suggestion). But if concept tokens can have the same vehicle within episodes of reasoning (however those are individuated), why not across episodes?
According to Shea, his architecture explains how thought does not fall prey to the frame problem (Chapter 6). As is well known, the expression “frame problem” refers to distinct, though related phenomena. Originally, the frame problem was the problem of explaining how some beliefs, but not others, are updated when we acquire new information about the world: When I learn that a blue ball has moved from one room to the next, why don’t I change my belief about its color? The expression “frame problem” then was extended to refer to the problem of explaining how if the computational theory of mind is right, thinkers can determine, in a computationally tractable way, what information is relevant, given that pretty much everything they know could be relevant (isotropy). Shea focuses on this second puzzle.
Taking his cue from deep neural networks (DNNs), artificial neural networks with many hidden layers between the input and output layers (Large Language Models are a type of DNNs), Shea argues that the mind solves the frame problem in part because of its capacity to encode, through extensive learning, a large number of built-in decision rules for classifying stimuli, which are accessed all at once, in a computationally light manner. In effect, DNNs are a good model for informational models, and their use does not fall prey to the frame problem. In addition, in reasoning, we can identify relevant information by means of heuristics. DNNs-like thinking and heuristics-based reasoning are not just “compounded”; rather they are integrated in a “hybrid” manner.
Shea proposes that concepts solve the frame problem by connecting reasoning and informational models: They take advantage of, and manipulate, the implicit relevance relations built in informational models, by modifying what is similar to what in the representational spaces these informational models embody. As he puts it,
since concepts act as an interface to special-purpose informational models, those systems can be re-purposed offline, in simulation mode, to generate relevant considerations on which to perform inferences in thought. Doing this across multiple different built-in assumptions of relevance can approximate an isotropic search for relevance. (169)
While Shea’s approach might be on the right track, some questions remain. For one, it is reasoning that is isotropic, and identifying relevant information among everything we know is primarily a problem for reasoning, as is illustrated by scientific induction or inference to the best explanation. Describing how simulations contribute to identifying relevant information does not in itself explain the isotropic nature of reasoning.
Furthermore, there is a tension between the idea that a concept is connected to particular informational models (instead of everything in the mind) and the idea that this connection explains how we deal with isotropy: the more circumscribed the models, the less isotropic concept-driven access to information is; the less circumscribed they are, the less concepts work as labels—rather, the resulting architecture begins to look like a generic dual-system architecture, where explicit reasoning is adjacent to other kinds of processes. Finally, relevance and similarity in a representational space are not the same, and transforming a representational space, thereby changing similarity relations within it, only addresses the frame problem if these transformations are made in a relevant manner, which, one might think, is the frame problem in the first place.
Be it as it may, these and other questions in no way detract from the excellence of Concepts at the Interface; rather, they highlight its depth and significance. Philosophers of cognitive science and cognitive scientists should read this book. It is a major contribution to our understanding of concepts and their role in human cognitive architecture, as well as broader philosophical and scientific questions about the mind.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
I am grateful to Nick Shea for his comments on a draft of this review.
REFERENCES
Blouw, P., Solodkin, E., Thagard, P., & Eliasmith, C. (2016). Concepts as Semantic Pointers: A Framework and Computational Model. Cognitive science, 40(5), 1128-1162.
Dove, G. (2022). Abstract Concepts and the Embodied Mind: Rethinking Grounded Cognition. Oxford University Press.
Laurence, S., & Margolis, E. (2024). The Building Blocks of Thought: A Rationalist Account of the Origins of Concepts. Oxford University Press.
Machery, E. (2009). Doing without Concepts. New York: Oxford University Press.
Machery, E. (2010). Replies to my critics. Philosophical Studies, 149(3), 429-436.
Machery, E. (2015). By Default: Concepts are Accessed in a Context-Independent Manner. In E. Margolis and S. Laurence (Eds.), The Conceptual Mind: New Directions in the Study of Concepts (pp. 567-588). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
McCaffrey, J. (in press). Concepts. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Quilty‐Dunn, J. (2021). Polysemy and thought: Toward a generative theory of concepts. Mind & Language, 36(1), 158-185.