There is a strange self-depreciation in the opening passages of Emad H. Atiq’s stimulating and sophisticated new book. He is both critical of its title (‘drab and not very informative’) and of its organising motif, the unification of one research agenda around ‘the rejection of another—namely, positivism’. The reader shouldn’t let the author put them off, though. Contained in the first part of the book is a series of provocative arguments against legal positivism: the view that the law of a political community is always and only a matter of human agency, of the rules posited or adopted by its institutions. In its second part, Atiq lays out in embryonic—and at times frustratingly incomplete—form his own understanding of law as a ‘goodness-fixing kind’. Together, these arguments represent an important contribution to the literature and a robust challenge to anyone inclined to the view that ‘the existence of law is one thing; its merit and demerit another’ (Austin, 1832, 157).
Contemporary Non-Positivism begins with an extended mediation on jurisprudential methodology. Since the publication of John Finnis’ Natural Law and Natural Rights and Brian Leiter’s broadside against non-naturalised approaches to the philosophy of law, jurisprudence has been a deeply methodologically self-conscious discipline, plausibly with diminishing returns. Atiq joins a crowded field of scholars thinking about what it means to make claims about the nature of law. His preferred approach—an explanation of the essential properties of law as a social kind—sits well within the idioms of contemporary metaphysics. Whether this represents a substantive as opposed to stylistic break from the form of understanding that Atiq takes as his point of departure—ordinary language analysis of the concept of law—is a contested question. Maybe someday someone will be able to convince me of how an explanation of the kind ‘bachelor’ differs from the analysis of the necessary and sufficient conditions for the application of that concept.
What matters most, of course, are first-order arguments, and Contemporary Non-Positivism contains plenty of these. Chapter Two details what Atiq considers to be the most persuasive counters to legal positivism. In addition to adopting Ronald Dworkin’s famous argument from theoretical disagreement and analysis of legal principles, he introduces three other considerations. The first is the historical practice of legal officials citing ‘natural’ or ‘a-priori’ law as ground for their decisions. Atiq gives the example of officials of the past citing as natural law—that is, as universally applicable across legal systems and justifiably applied independent of any institutional warrant—the legal principle that no person should be judge of their own case. It is easy to see why judges would be attracted to such descriptions. A person acting as judge over their own interests is inimical to the idea of independent adjudication that legal systems attempt to instantiate (with varying degrees of success). This also explains why such a principle is justifiably invoked in court decisions across legal orders. The only question for legal positivism is whether such a standard should be thought of as part of the law absent institutional adoption or endorsement. That legal systems may respect ideals of procedural fairness to varying degrees is indication that it should not.
While Atiq’s first argument against legal positivism concerns its adequacy at the level of individual laws, his second deals with its adequacy at the level of legal systems. We learn from H. L. A. Hart, Atiq suggests, that law is to be distinguished from raw coercive power based on officials’ and subjects’ commitment to the legal system as something genuinely ‘worthy of obedience’ (24). The intuition behind this idea, Atiq suggests, is that clear instances of legal systems are worthy of our respect. Consequently, positivism has trouble explaining ‘edge cases’, e.g., when a system’s norms and institutions are designed only for the betterment of its ruling class. Hart, however, never held the view that Atiq attributes to him. His two minimum conditions for the existence of a legal system are that officials accept its secondary rules—the rules determining what is law, how it may be changed, and who may adjudicate disputes— and that individuals submit to most of the system’s first order rules most of the time. The former condition ensures the existence of recognisably legal institutions and the latter the efficacy of law. Hart is clear that individuals may submit to the law for any reason, including blind fear. Such a situation would be in one sense pathological, but it would not fail to qualify as law for this reason. In turn, the form of acceptance that must be manifested by officials is a cognitive— not evaluative—stance. It is the same phenomena that is manifested whenever rules are treated as binding, including by players in a game of chess (Hart, 1961, 56-57). What of Atiq’s suggestion that a regime of personal betterment is at the very least a borderline case of law? We needn’t go so far as to join Pashukanis and other Marxists in their belief that it is only law if it functions to the betterment of the ruling class. Nonetheless, the idea that the legal and political system may be captured and used to the personal benefit of its rulers is an unfortunately familiar one. Aristotle named this form of rule oligarchy, and he considered it a deficient but not borderline instance of political organization.
The third of Atiq’s attacks on legal positivism paves the way for his own positive argument about the nature of law. This pertains to the way in which legal systems are subject to their own internal standards of excellence. Law shares with clocks, hospitals and novels the fact that individual instances count as better or worse examples of the genre to which they belong. We can say, for example, of The Old Man and the Sea that it is a better novel than The Da Vinci Code, and the Mayo Clinic a good hospital in the same sense that the caesium atomic clock is a good clock. In each of these cases, we bring to bear standards that are relative to the object in question. The Old Man and the Sea is good qua novel, and the Mayo Clinic is good qua hospital. What grounds these kind-relative forms of evaluation? The most obvious answer has to do with the relevant object’s ability to fulfil its function or to achieve its purpose. The caesium atomic clock is very good at telling the time, and The Old Man and the Sea is written in exceptional prose. Atiq notes the wide consensus among legal philosophers that legal systems—like clocks, novels, and hospitals—are subject to their own internal standards of excellence. These are encapsulated by the idea of the rule of law or legality, which requires that legal systems instantiate clear, consistent rules and enforce them according to their terms. Different legal orders may be more or less capable of living up to this ideal and hence, more or less satisfactory examples of the genre to which they belong. Telephone justice in Soviet-era Russia seriously undermined the rule of law. Today, the attempts of many governments to shield their actions from legal oversight also threaten this ideal. Legal systems that fail to live up to the requirements of the rule of law are less than shining examples of the type. They compromise in one way or another on law’s ability to fulfil its function.
Given that all of this is commonplace among legal philosophers of different stripes, one may wonder how Atiq uses these insights to mount an attack on positivism. He does so by introducing two additional premises. First, that the rule of law is best thought of as a ‘normative property’. Second, that functional kinds are subject to what he calls ‘threshold conditions’. Individual instances of the relevant kind must fulfil their function to some degree in order to count as examples of the type. Atiq suggests that these claims taken together trouble positivism because they imply that whenever we have law, we have something of value. These arguments are repeated and reinforced in Chapter Three to make out the outlines of Atiq’s own positive understanding of law as a ‘normative artefact’: a social construct with inherent worth.
What are we to make of these arguments? Consider first the claim that the rule of law is a normative standard. There is a sense in which this is inescapably so. Legality is, after all, an ideal for legal systems. It is normative in that it allows for the evaluation of legal orders as more or less able to fulfil law’s social role. But this is clearly not the sense of normativity that Atiq has in mind. Criminal enterprises, extortion rackets, and torture devices are also subject to their own standards of excellence. No one thinks that it follows from this that precision waterboarding is an inherently valuable activity. Rather, by normative property, Atiq means to suggest that the rule of law represents something of value akin to ‘the property of being reasonable or admirable or fair’ (32). It is normative in the sense that it represents a moral achievement. Since Lon Fuller, many have been tempted by claims of this type, with the implication that a political community has reason to create law and legal institutions in order to instantiate the value of the rule of law. Two crucial difficulties arise for defenders of such accounts. First, they must identify the nature of the value instantiated by the rule of law. Second, they must explain why a rule-of-law-compliant legal system is something of positive moral valence. Fuller famously fell at the first hurdle, suggesting that the value associated with the rule of law was that of governing conduct through rules. But this neither names a value nor represents a practice that is inherently valuable. Atiq does one better on this score. He gestures at a recent argument by Peter Railton that the idea of interpersonal fairness explains the moral salience of the rule of law. Unlike the idea of governance through rules, fairness is a moral ideal. The difficulty is seeing how a rule-of-law-compliant legal system instantiates it. Institutions of slavery or gross racial segregation, for example, may be perfectly compatible with the rule of law. They may be clear, prospective, and impartially enforced. They nonetheless invert rather than instantiate any idea of fairness.
The rule of law is thus compatible with grave injustice. It is nonetheless hard to give up on the idea that it represents something of moral relevance, that in a legal order it matters whether the rule of law is respected or defied. How to square this circle? Joseph Raz made the most progress on this question. On his view, the rule of law was a negative virtue. It is a standard that guards against the very wrongs that law as an institutionalised system of rules makes possible. Once established, rules may be contradictory or otherwise incomplete. They may be departed from by institutions dutybound to observe them. By ensuring that the law is in good shape to guide the conduct of those that live under it, the rule of law guards against these sorts of vices, but it neither speaks in favour of law as a mode of governance nor the particular standards that legal institutions adopt or create. In this way, the rule of law represents a side constraint on legal action. If we are to have law, then it better be responsive to the rule of law, but the idea of legality neither settles the first question nor imposes any restriction on the ends that legal orders pursue. Rule-of-law-compliant law may be pointless or perverse. It may even constitute a moral abomination consistent with its steadfast legality. A legal system that fails to abide by the rule of law is thus worthy of our criticism, but one that abides by that ideal is not yet deserving of our respect.
Regardless of one’s view of the moral status of the rule of law, we may wonder what follows from such a commitment. No doubt a good novel instantiates value, but for every The Handmaid’s Tale, there is also a Fifty Shades of Grey. And we might suggest the same with law. Some legal systems live up to the ideal of legality, and others fail miserably. Whether they do is a matter of the character and coherence of their laws and the functionality of their institutions, facts which inevitably vary between legal systems. It is here that Atiq’s second argument becomes important. Functional kinds are, he suggests, subject to threshold conditions such that ‘an object must be minimally good at performing the kind-relative function’ (33) in order to count as an instance of the type. Such a constraint, Atiq argues, holds in general and ‘finds confirmation in leading philosophical theories of the nature of artefacts’ (33). A first difficulty is that it appears not to. A broken clock is still a clock, and a hospital that harms while trying to help its patients is still a hospital, even if it fails at achieving its essential function. This suggests a different connection between objects and their constitutive functions. An object is an instance of a type if, in addition to being created to fulfil that function, it is the kind of thing that could do so. The failing hospital is capable of being reformed, and the broken clock can be fixed. Fifty Shades of Grey could have been a better novel, and the world a better place for it.
Do we have reason to conceive of law differently? Fuller thought so. He told a story about a failed king who tried to govern only retrospectively or exclusively through secret laws. In such situations, he claimed, there would be only the attempt to create legal order. His conclusion was that all legal systems must approximate the ideal of legality to count as law. Fuller was, I think, right in his claim but wrong in his conclusion. It is true that a system of purely retrospective law would likely fail but not because of any existential connection between law and the requirements of the rule of law. Rather, it would fail because law is an actual system of governance. It is an effective means of regulating social life. An order of entirely retrospective or secret rules would be unlikely to meet this benchmark and would fail to qualify as law for this reason. Fuller’s fable is about the efficacy of law, not the rule of law.
There are, thus, good reasons to doubt whether either of Atiq’s claims successfully pave the way for thinking of law as a ‘normative artefact’. A rule-of-law-compliant legal system is not a morally good thing in and of itself. And a legal order need not instantiate this ideal to count as an example of the type. Law is certainly the kind of thing that must be capable of living up to the rule of law, but this condition is met just as well by regimes that flout it as those that meet it.
For readers familiar with the field, many of the claims I have made above will have an air of familiarity. Indeed, one of the surprising features of Atiq’s argument is that it falls squarely within a tradition—namely, the Fullerian, legal process school—yet does not engage in depth with that tradition nor with arguments made in opposition to it. To an extent, this is understandable. A book about contemporary non-positivism inevitably involves deciding when the present starts and excluding otherwise relevant literature by dint of such an operation. It is also in the nature of a work that forms part of an introductory series that it must give over space to outlining arguments that are not those of the author. Indeed, Contemporary Non-Positivism is often at its best when unpacking, explaining, and criticising the arguments of others. Atiq is an agile philosopher with an excellent turn of phrase and he does a valued service introducing the reader to the arguments of contemporary natural lawyers like Jonathan Crowe, Mark Murphy, and Mark Greenberg. Where the book does less well is in motivating Atiq’s own positive position. At several crucial junctures, the reader is referred to other work by the author to fill in the blanks. Core ideas are sometimes floated rather than advanced. When I said earlier that Atiq gestures at Railton’s argument about fairness, I meant it. He doesn’t offer a defence of such an account, crucial as doing so would be to showing that the rule of law is a normative property in the sense he describes. A stronger grounding in the history of the discipline might also help sharpen the contribution. At times, Atiq is treading on familiar territory, and he would do well to avoid the pitfalls of those who have traversed it before him. Contemporary Non-Positivism is an engaging read by a gifted legal philosopher, albeit one who has yet to put flesh on the bones of his own thinking about law.
REFERENCES
John Austin, The Province of Jurisprudence Determined (Cambridge University Press, 1832 (1995)).
H.L.A. Hart, The Concept of Law (Oxford University Press, 1961, (2012)).