Jokes are no joke; they can harm, disparage, and reinforce an unjust social hierarchy. Jokes also function in a complex communicative manner, and when we are amused, we are less critical of the derogating messages conveyed by jokes. In Dangerous Jokes: How Racism and Sexism Weaponize Humor, Claire Horisk argues persuasively for these claims. The book is clearly and carefully written in a manner accessible to a general audience. This is no small feat since the book also successfully incorporates complex tools from the philosophy of language as well as quite a bit of empirical research. It also argues for two novel philosophical claims. For philosophers of language interested in manipulative speech, and indeed for anyone interested in how jokes actually work, this is a must read. It’s also fun, highly informative, surprising in many ways, and philosophically astute.
Horisk makes a slew of important distinctions, but she focuses her attention on what she calls belittlement. A joke is belittling if it conveys a negative stereotype that supports—or has supported—an unjust social hierarchy. Jokes that demean lawyers are not belittling but jokes that demean women are; the difference, for Horisk, lies in the broader social structure and the subordinate position of the targeted group in that hierarchy.
One of the many things that the book does is bridge common sense beliefs about jokes with both philosophical theory and empirical evidence. To this end, Horisk identifies several widespread folk beliefs about jokes, assesses whether these theses are true, and also explains why they might seem true, even when they are false. The Harmless Fun thesis claims that jokes cannot be harmful; this thesis is refuted but Horisk argues that it might seem true because of two other theses: Wrong Audience and Wrong Joker. Wrong Audience claims that jokes can seem to be problematic when told to the wrong audience. The idea here is that a joke can seem harmful even when it is not but this is because it is told either to humorless people who don’t manage to get the joke or to oversensitive people who react to it in unwarranted ways. This thesis is also false, but there’s a surprising twist. People who are amused by a belittling joke might seem like the right audience for it. But, as Horisk argues, when one is amused by a joke, one is more likely to rely on less critical cognitive faculties; this means that one is more likely to uncritically accept the belittling content conveyed. The amused audience then is, in an important sense, the wrong one. The third thesis, Wrong Joker, contends that it is acceptable to tell a belittling joke about one’s own social group but not about a group to which one does not belong. Again, this thesis purports to protect Harmless Fun from apparent counter evidence and again the results are surprising. Although one might think that self-deprecating humor is less harmful than belittling other groups, the evidence suggests otherwise. When one belittles a different group, one violates a social norm against doing so, and the evidence suggests that doing that triggers critical faculties in one’s audience, thus potentially preventing them from taking the harmful content on board. When one tells a self-disparaging joke, by contrast, that particular social norm is not violated and so the audience is less likely to be critical of the harmful content conveyed.
One interesting issue not directly addressed by the book concerns the basis of amusement. One might be amused by the belittling content conveyed by a joke but one might also be amused by something else about it: the clever word play, the inside information required to get the joke, the unexpected nature of the crucial connection, the delivery, the timing, or any number of things. Although judiciously avoiding these complexities, Horisk is characteristically careful; she does not assume that being amused by a belittling joke involves endorsing the belittling content. Instead, she says only that if one is amused by such a joke, then that is some (circumstantial) evidence to think that one might hold such beliefs, and this is reason enough to investigate them.
This is a genuine crossover book, so in addition to making these issues available to a general audience and to identifying the above surprising empirical results, Horisk also argues for two novel philosophical theses. First, she argues that belittling jokes convey belittling content via generalized conversational implicatures. Prior philosophical attention to racist and sexist jokes did not concern their communicative function. Mostly, such work concerns the ethics of telling and enjoying (that is, being amused by or laughing at) such jokes. Second, Horisk develops an account of culpable listening. According to Horisk, when one is a participant in a conversation in which a belittling joke is told, one acts wrongly by allowing that belittling content into the common ground. This wrong is prior to any failure to speak out against that content. She says, “listening to racist language is sometimes wrong; challenging it is a corrective measure, which can be used to make reparations for the wrong (132)”. While many think that failing to object to belittling content can be wrong, Horisk goes considerably further; for Horisk, it’s wrong to even listen. This is an interesting—and even radical—claim.
In what follows, I will focus on the first claim, namely that belittling jokes convey content via generalized conversational implicature. As is well known, jokes convey content without explicitly stating that content and implicature is one way to convey content without saying it. There are several kinds: conventional implicature, particularized conversational implicature, and generalized conversational implicature. A generalized conversational implicature conveys content via a presumption that a speaker is being communicatively cooperative (this makes it conversational) but it does not rely on specific features of the conversational context (so it is generalized). Here are some examples of generalized conversational implicature. ‘Sally ate some of the cake’ generally implicates that Sally did not eat all of the cake, and ‘The pool is warm’ generally implicates that the pool is not hot. Horisk argues that belittling jokes convey their belittling content via this sort of invited inference.
Even though this is a public philosophy book that ought to omit technical and potentially distracting details, I’d nevertheless like for Horisk to say more. First, one might wonder whether Horisk is assuming that all jokes convey implicit content in the same way. Horisk does not make this assumption explicit or give any reason to support it. And it seems that there is good reason to reject it. After all, jokes are complex and varied. Why think that word play jokes convey implicit content the same way as narrative jokes? Second, it is unclear that Horisk’s argumentative strategy excludes all (plausible) alternatives. To see this, let’s first summarize Horisk’s argument, which is two-fold. She begins by arguing that belittling jokes share two features with generalized conversational implicatures: reinforcement and cancellation. Then, she argues against a presuppositional account, which she identifies as the main alternative account.
These features (of reinforcement and cancellation) are also features of particularized implicatures. So it’s unclear why this consideration supports Horisk’s contention (that belittling jokes convey content via generalized implicatures) as opposed to the claim that they—or at least some of them—convey that content via particularized implicatures. Narrative jokes, for example, often with quite rich contextual features, seem like especially good candidates for conveying content via particularized implicature. Horisk should say more.
In arguing against presuppositional accounts, Horisk targets Robert Stalnaker’s (fairly specific notion of) pragmatic presupposition. To pragmatically presuppose something, in Stalnaker’s sense, is to treat it as already shared (i.e., accepted by all and recognized as accepted by all) or to treat it as something that would be uncontroversially accepted by all. For those unfamiliar, some examples will help. When speaking with a family friend, one can take for granted that one has a sibling. That information is already shared, and it can be legitimately presupposed. We can also introduce presuppositions. To see this, suppose that I am speaking to a colleague (who doesn’t know anything about my birth family) and I excuse myself from a conversation by saying that I need to respond to my brother’s email; in this case, I presuppose that I have a brother and I legitimately do so even though my colleague does not already accept this (so it is not shared at the time of my utterance). I nevertheless presuppose it, because I rely on it and reasonably expect that my colleague will happily accept it.
Horisk argues against a presuppositional account with what she calls the contentious joker. Consider the following joke: “Hey, did you hear that Wellesley had to close its philosophy department? Yah, they lost all their majors as soon as the college required logic as part of the major.” This joke relies on the social belief that women are not good at math. Suppose now that Paul, a sexist jerk, tells this joke to his feminist friend, Helen, and he does so in order to get an (entertaining-to-him) rise out of her. Paul is a contentious joker. He does not believe that Helen accepts—or would readily accept—the claim that women are not good at math. As a result, and although the joke seems to presuppose that women cannot do math, it does not satisfy Stalnaker’s notion of presupposition. According to Horisk, this tells against presuppositional accounts and in favor of her generalized implicature account.
Horisk is absolutely correct that the contentious joker does not presuppose, in Stalnaker’s sense, that women cannot do math. But Stalnaker’s account is not the only account in town; it’s quite narrow. Moreover, Stalnaker’s account is designed for ideal contexts and an ignorant jerk telling a sexist joke to a card-carrying feminist does not seem to be an ideal context. (In later chapters, Horisk skillfully extends Stalnaker’s common ground framework in order to explain power differences amongst participants.) There also seems to be another option: one might think that Paul is flouting the norms of presupposition; he is pretending to presuppose something in order to irritate; on this way of thinking, which seems intuitive, Paul is still presupposing but he is abusing the practice of doing so. It’s also not clear how Horisk’s preferred account would fare with Paul’s joke; that is, it is not clear that Paul’s joke conveys belittling content via generalized implicature, as Horisk would have it. And, finally, as we saw above, jokes can convey content in different ways so even if a presuppositional account cannot handle the contentious joker, it does not follow that a presuppositional account cannot correctly explain how other jokes convey belittling content.
Horisk’s account of culpable listening is the most innovative and controversial claim in her excellent book. The claim, the account of it, and the arguments in favor of it are each too subtle and complex to investigate responsibly in such a short review. Consequently, I confine myself to two short comments. First, the view relies heavily on Stalnaker’s notion of common ground and so a lot depends on exactly what is required for something to be a part of the common ground. Second, there’s good news: Horisk’s future work will extend what she says here on the topic.
In sum, Dangerous Jokes: How Racism and Sexism Weaponize Humor is a terrific, informative, clear, accessible, unpretentious, careful, and innovative book on an important topic. It’s fun to read and teach. I recommend it as required reading for all social philosophers of language and for anyone interested in the subtle ways that jokes mask the harmful content they sometimes convey.