Bin Song enters longstanding debates over the status of transcendence as a concept in Chinese thought with a book that offers clarity, nuance, and a compelling theoretical intervention. In facing the question of whether Chinese thought has a concept of transcendence, voices on opposing sides often claim the same underlying commitment. Those who answer “yes” are often aligning themselves against Eurocentrism, that is, against the idea that European thought has privileged access to certain philosophical or religious insights. Yet those who answer “no” are also often aligning themselves against Eurocentrism. That is, they are making the point that we should not import terms and categories from European discourses into Chinese ones but rather should learn and utilize indigenous concepts and frameworks.
Entering these complex dynamics, Song shifts the discourse, asking not how Eurocentric philosophy should accommodate others but rather how a “Ruist comparative theology” might encounter, engage, and evaluate diverse traditions. His use of "Ruist," referring to the lineage of scholars or literati, reflects his preference for a more etymologically accurate translation of Chinese terms typically rendered as “Confucianism.” Part of Song's approach to comparative theology is rooted in Ruism’s historical interactions with European theologians dating back to the 1500s; part reflects Song’s constructive project aimed at presenting Ruism as a contemporary philosophy and way of life.
The first two chapters establish Song’s theoretical lens on theology, especially related to the use of this term in a Chinese context. In “Comparative Theology as a Liberal Art”, Song encourages contemporary scholars to look back to the pre-Christian use of theology in Aristotle’s work to reclaim both the existential valence and pluralistic openness of the term. Likewise, in “Comparative Theology as a Science”, Song returns to the Greeks to revive a sense of the spiritual dimensions of observation and inquiry as parts of a larger philosophical lifeway.
In taking readers outside certain ossified truisms about assumed differences between the so-called East and West, Song relies on the work of Pierre Hadot to help build his vision of Greek philosophy as a tradition largely in agreement with Ruism in practice, if not always in theory. By framing theology as a component of a pre-Christian philosophical lifeway that conducted rational inquiry and empirical observation as spiritual exercises, Song allows us to imagine Ruist interventions in current discourse. What if the influence of Church doctrine had not shorn philosophy of its spiritual components and separated it from theology? What if Europe’s modernist trajectory had not veered toward a reductive scientism and splintered off so many separate disciplines from the broad-ranging philosophy of the Greeks? In a sense, Ruism gives us glimpses of other directions our own discourse might have gone had “Western” thought not taken these specific historical twists and turns.
I say this is imaginative because, of course, Greek and Chinese scholars were not in communication with each other during the period at which there might have been the greatest overlap. Song’s third chapter, “The Transcendence Debate in the History of Christian-Ru Interaction”, picks up at the point of first contact, namely, encounters between literati in the latter half of the Ming dynasty (1368–1644) and Catholic clergy whose sense of “theology” was already quite distant from Aristotle’s. Song traces the debates over transcendence to the work of Matteo Ricci (1552–1610) and associated missionaries, who were deeply impressed by (and conversant in) China’s rich classical heritage but who nonetheless sought to establish that the ultimacy of Taiji 太極 (which Song translates as Ultimate Limit) was, indeed, not ultimate enough. This is the beginning of the debate: “For them [i.e., Catholic missionaries], the Christian God was more transcendent since He alone could be the origin of cosmic realities, including the reality of Taiji” (56).
Song then traces the discourse through the work of James Legge (1815–1897) and into a range of twentieth century and contemporary scholars, including Christian theologians (such as Hyo-Dong Lee), Ruist philosophers (such as Tu Wei-ming), and comparativists (such as David L. Hall, Roger T. Ames, and Robert Cummings Neville). Here, Song’s careful parsing is extraordinarily helpful in disambiguating the layers of miscommunication that have accrued in the debates over time.
As he shows, many scholars talk past each other, using different definitions of transcendence and hence not directly addressing opposing viewpoints. Likewise, many scholars are rooted in specific Ruist schools and do not necessarily clarify how this shapes their positions in the debates. That is, as Song insightfully discusses, one will have a very different Ruist answer to the question of transcendence if one is implicitly drawing from Zhang Zai (1020–1077) versus Zhu Xi (1130–1200), or, relatedly, if one is not engaging Song dynasty developments in Ruism at all. Song’s overview moves quickly, but he provides several helpful charts that allow readers to see overarching dynamics. He draws out at least four uses of transcendence at play in the debates: “something determinate and ontologically unconditioned”; “something indeterminate and ontologically unconditioned”; “something constantly advancing” beyond present conditions; and “something beyond humans” that is the source human life and the origin of moral values (68).
Song indicates that his concern is with the first two senses. That is, his book investigates the question of whether Taiji or Tian might be considered an ontologically independent creator who brings forth the existing cosmos out of nothing. To disambiguate the debates, Song proposes to provide a thorough historical overview of the development of the concept of creatio ex nihilo in Christian thought and the concept of sheng sheng 生生, or “birth, birth”, in Chinese thought. This occupies the fifth, sixth, seventh, and eighth chapters.
First, however, Song spends the fourth chapter addressing questions of method by surveying methodological options drawn from the areas of comparative theology, comparative religion, and comparative philosophy of religion. Drawing on his use of theology established earlier, he refers to his own method of Ruist comparative theology “as a rooted, nonconfessional, and scientific liberal art” (85). He identifies his central hermeneutic tools as the notions of “vague category” (drawn from Neville’s Piercean semiotics) and “situational thinking” (drawn from Jonathan Z. Smith’s Wittgensteinian approach to the study of religion). At this point, I would have been interested to hear some of Song’s methodological commitments articulated in the language of Ruist scholarly practices, although this dimension is implicit in Song’s overall approach to Ruism as a way of life in other chapters.
With his methodology in place, Song investigates creatio ex nihilo from Plato through Friedrich Schleiermacher (1768–1834) and Paul Tillich (1886–1965) and sheng sheng from Confucius through Zhu Xi and later Ming dynasty interpreters and critics. This culminates in Song’s assessment of Zhu Xi’s metaphysics in reference to sheng sheng as an expression not of creatio ex nihilo but generatio ex nihilo. Unlike those competing scholars whom Song refers to as Qi-monists, Zhu Xi asserts what Song describes as the ontological priority of Li (pattern-principle) with respect to Qi (vital-energy).
Song further differentiates, however, two senses of Li suggested by Zhu’s work, namely, Li as existing patterns in a Qi-based cosmos and Li as Taiji or Ultimate Limit, “the ultimate creative power that generates all possible vital-energies and their pattern-principles” (235). As Song notes, Zhu Xi does not make this distinction consistently. Accordingly, Song argues against conflating Li and Taiji. By maintaining this distinction, Song says, we gain a picture of Zhu’s mature metaphysics in which Taiji is the indeterminate and ontologically independent source of Li and Qi. Song’s final position in the transcendence debates asserts the similarity between the Zhu Xi lineage of Ruism and what Song calls a minor (as opposed to mainstream) strand of Christian theology, namely, “the de-anthropomorphic understandings of divine creation in Schleiermacher’s and Tillich’s thought” (237).
Throughout the book, Song refers to Ruist comparative theology as a “seeded, open inclusivism” that avoids the totalizing trajectory often problematized in critical discourses on transcendence. In particular, at various points in his argument, Song addresses those critics who might say that Christian theology and Western metaphysics, relying on the language of transcendence, have both been implicated in Europe’s imperialist and colonialist projects, and he defends his understanding of transcendence in Ruism in light of these concerns.
In his concluding chapter, he sums up his responses to a variety of voices in the transcendence debates, applies his Ruist comparative theology to a selection of other issues (such as theodicy), and indicates directions for future research (especially more investigation into the question of transcendence for the Qi-focused lineages of Ruism, which play less of a role in Song’s book, but which perhaps accord with strands of European thought that privilege the language of immanence and process). As Song insightfully points out, his own comparison has been carefully delimited in recognition of the diversity of thought across both Chinese and European contexts, making any essentialized picture of “East” and “West” untenable (262).
Given how entrenched scholars may be on one side or another in the transcendence debates, possibly Song’s book will change no minds. Nonetheless, no matter where a given reader stands, I would recommend this book broadly to anyone working in Chinese philosophy, sinology, comparative theology, and related areas. Many features of Song’s argument are compelling on their own, regardless of the debates, such as his careful parsing of Matteo Ricci’s Chinese sources, his reconstruction of Zhu Xi’s mature thought, and his overall methodological lens on Ruist comparative theology. This book marks the successful culmination of a research trajectory that Song has been developing for many years and that promises fruitful conversations to come.