Descartes’s Method by Tarek Dika is perhaps the most thorough book on Descartes’s Rules for the Direction of the Mind. It is an exceptional volume written for Cartesian scholars and provides a novel and ingenious interpretation of Descartes’s infamous method, reviving it from literary slumber. Dika provides interesting responses to many of the traditional issues in the literature and is the first author to incorporate the recently published Cambridge Manuscript of the Rules to bolster his interpretation. He provides an in-depth, detailed, and well-documented account of Descartes’s faculty psychology, the non-uniform procedures of the method, the heuristics of enumeration, mathesis universalis as propaedeutic to natural philosophy, the “most noble example,” the non-hierarchical theory of simple natures, the mathematics in Rules 13–21 and how this geometrical calculus resulted in the demise of the Rules (but not the method), the proof of the anaclastic curve, and why, according to Dika, the method is efficacious.
In Part I, “The Habitual Unity of Science,” Dika contends that Descartes’s method is not a sui generis set of heuristic rules that, if followed, leads a Cartesian investigator to knowledge in natural philosophy, as is traditionally argued for (and against) in the literature. Dika’s remarkable claim is that the method is a scientific habitus (ch. 2), a cognitive disposition (virtue) of one’s ingenium to solve problems in natural philosophy, akin to the ethical habitus of Aristotle, Thomas Aquinas, John Duns Scotus, and Francisco Suarez (ch. 1). The methodical procedures, on Dika’s interpretation, are universal, applicable to any question accessible to human reason, but the method is also non-uniform; there is no fixed, mechanistic procedure for a Cartesian investigator to follow, contrary to what seems to be Descartes’s claim in Rule 5 of the Rules and in the Discourse on Method (8, 347). Dika’s seemingly ruleless method is an outstanding claim, especially considering the title of the work—Rules for the Direction of the Mind. Nevertheless, Dika’s assertion is that there are no absolute rules to the method. There are, however, contextual rules based on the parameters of the problem (93–102, 117–119, 144). Although the thesis may seem relativistic— “Do whatever whenever”—and vacuous (the method provides minimal guidance to solving problems), Dika asserts that his habitus interpretation provides “unity” to Cartesian science, for one’s ingenium coordinates the sciences to solve particular problems (73–74).
In Part II, “The Operations and Culture of the Method,” Dika provides a detailed account of Descartes’s faculty psychology and its operations (ch. 3). In line with the literature, Dika distinguishes the corporeal faculties (i.e., sensation, imagination and memory) as aids to achieving knowledge and the intellect (intuition and deduction) as vis cognoscens(the knowing power part of ingenium). In addition, he proposes that enumeration is not only a heuristic, that is, not merely a helpful procedure conducted by his faculties, but is itself a faculty. Descartes proposes three procedures for this proposed faculty. He begins with a question, and then proceeds through enumeration by analyzing the question into sub-questions and these into more simple questions. Ultimately, the answers to the simple questions provide premises to answer the sub-questions, and, last, the initial question. Thus, the first kind of enumeration provides a framework for the method. The second kind is Descartes’s procedure for answering a question. In this case, Descartes enumerates viable explanations/solutions to a question and the cognition of the answer along with the denial of the other possibilities is cognized by enumeration (103). In contrast, other commentators contend that “intuition” cognizes the correct answer, but Dika’s claim is that the question is solved solely through “enumeration,” again, making it a faculty, a power of ingenium. The third kind of enumeration is the well-known procedure described in Rules 7 and 11 that reduces complex inferences to a near single cognition by providing repetitive reviews of the finished deduction, practically eliminating memory. What is controversial and innovative about Dika’s account is not only his claim that enumeration is a faculty, but his claim that vis cognoscens is composed of intuition and deduction as well as enumeration, and that the latter can solve problems independent of the former—a claim that seems to be in tension with Descartes’s account of the intellect, e.g., “we can have no knowledge without mental intuition or deduction” (AT 10:368, 370, 372; CSM 1:14, 15, 16).
Dika next turns to the controversial issue of the identity of mathesis universalis in Rule 4 (Jean-Paul Weber’s and John Schuster’s Rule 4B in Weber (1964) and Schuster (1980) respectively). Dika’s contention is that universal mathematics is propaedeutic to science, used to prepare the Cartesian ingenium to produce a habitus of solving scientific problems, first, in mathematics and, later, in natural philosophy (ch. 4). The Cartesian investigator, Dika tells us, is to practice “recreational mathematics” and the “so-called feminine arts” to build one’s sagacity in intuition and perspicacity in deduction and, later, will graduate to solving “the simplest and easiest mathematical sciences [. . .] the theory of proportions,” i.e., mathesis universalis (120). This practice will prepare an investigator to solve the “problem of the limits of knowledge” and then Descartes’s more advanced mathematics sketched in Rules 13–21 (perfect problems) before turning to imperfectly understood problems in natural philosophy. In contrast, John Schuster (2013) notably argues that Descartes’s mathesis universalis refers to his early mathematics linked to his programmatic phase of physico-mathematics developed with Issac Beeckman before his inflection to a general scientific method. For Schuster, Descartes created the method, in part, by generalizing aspects of mathesis universalis. In response, Dika uses Sergeantson and Edwards’s recent publication of the Cambridge Manuscript (CM) to undermine Schuster’s historically grounded argument. Sergeantson et al.’s (2023, 55–60) claim that the CM is an early manuscript of the Rules seems to be groundbreaking because this draft does not contain Descartes’s remarks about mathesis universalis, which, for Sergeantson et al., indicates that universal mathematics is a later development and, thus, that the method could not arise from it (137–140). Schuster (2023) contends, on the other hand, that the CM is a late “curated” draft in which Descartes redacted parts (i.e., Rule 4B and the content on simple natures that were part of a largely complete version of the Rules, what Schuster calls the “Ur-source”) to make the method digestible to new consumers (e.g., Cardinal Bérulle et al. after the Chandoux lecture) before Descartes’s move to Holland.
In Part III, “The First Problem of the Method,” Dika takes up the heated issue of the “most noble example” in Rule 8, the problem of establishing the limits and scope of human knowledge. Descartes begins his solution (ch. 6) by enumerating the human cognitive faculties. He defines the corporeal faculties as dubitable, the intellect as certain, and concludes that only intuition and deduction can achieve knowledge. Dika’s contribution is the claim that this problem could not be solved by the intellectual faculties, for intuition cannot intuit that only intuition and deduction are capable of human knowledge (118, 145–146). Thus, Dika concludes that the first problem of the method is solved by enumeration.
Dika next turns to Descartes’s theory of simple natures in his problem of the limits of knowledge (ch. 7). There are three kinds of simple natures: material (e.g., extension, shape, motion), intellectual (e.g., volition, doubt, knowledge), and common (e.g., existence, unity, duration). Descartes asserts that the scope of knowledge is based on the extent of the combinations of these. Dika provides a detailed and exhaustive account of Descartes’s theory in Rule 8 and its sequel in Rule 12. His main contribution, however, is not revealed until chapter 11. Dika asserts that metaphysics cannot be foundational in the Rules, and this is because all simple natures are “equally knowable” (329). For Dika, there is no absolute ordering of simple natures in the Rules in contrast to the tree of philosophy in the Principles, no beginning with metaphysics and proceeding to physics and, then, to medicine, mechanics, and morals. In response, it seems that “equally knowable” does not “rule out” a hierarchy of the sciences. There is explicitly a hierarchy among the simple natures in any given problem, as Dika informs us, and, given his account of enumeration, a conclusion in a chain of inference is as equally known as the premises; the same would hold for a general architectonics with metaphysics at its foundation.
In Part IV, “Perfect and Imperfectly Understood Problems,” Dika provides a thorough account of Descartes’s mathematics developed in Rules 13–21 as an example of perfectly understood problems (ch. 9) and Descartes’s “proof” of the anaclastic curve as an imperfectly understood problem (ch. 10). In the latter, Dika provides a succinct summary of the popular reconstructions, all of which assert that Descartes discovered the law of refraction through, first, mathematics, after which he developed a physical description, which fits Descartes’s physico-mathematical procedure that he developed with Isaac Beeckman pre-Rules. In contrast, Dika’s reconstruction relies, in part, on Descartes’s description of the “proof” in Rule 8, where Descartes begins the constructive stage of the method with physics and then proceeds to mathematics.
Additionally, Dika explains Descartes’s mature mathematics in the later Rules, the chief example of his “perfectly understood problems.” Descartes’s aim was to unify mathematics through his theory of proportions using a calculus that only includes lines and rectangles. Dika shows that Descartes’s theory successfully explains discrete magnitudes in arithmetic, but that geometry contains both discrete and continuous magnitudes, requiring square roots in his algebraic equations, which necessitate circles (not known through intuition). This failure of his geometrical calculus resulted in the demise of the Rules (268).
In Part V, “Beyond Rules,” Dika explains (ch. 11) the fate of the method post-Rules. As we see in the Discourse and Principles, Descartes’s philosophy evolved into a hierarchical structure, and he rarely made references to the method. Did Descartes discard the method? Dika informs us that Descartes jettisoned the requirement that simple natures did not have an absolute ordering, and, further, that Descartes updated his theory of matter and intuition to accommodate his corpuscularianism (matter is indefinitely divisible) and plenum theory (matter extends indefinitely) that he developed in The World (1630–1632). However, despite these changes and others, Dika contends that the method was endorsed and used throughout Descartes’s mature philosophy.
In the Conclusion, Dika asserts that the method is efficacious and that this allows a response to post-Kuhnian historians and sociologists in the history and philosophy of science who are skeptical of method narratives (349–351). The thrust of Dika’s response is that post-Kuhnians provide “criticisms” to jettison past commentator’s sui generis (mechanical) models of the method. Dika’s proposal, however, is that Descartes’s method is not an absolute mechanical procedure, but has rules based on the parameters of the problem. Given this, Dika claims to dodge the blows of the myth of method criticisms thrown by Gaston Bachelard (1984), Alexandre Koyré (1978), Thomas Kuhn (1962), Paul Feyerabend (1993), and John Schuster 2013). In response, the issue of post-Kuhnian science is complex; covering the dynamics of science (proposals, negotiations, refinement, acceptance, and rejection of bids) in diverse, sui generis expert fields and sub-fields of research that post-Kuhnians highlight is not similar to simple, abstract method narratives. Given these dynamics, Dika’s final paragraph is insufficient to provide a refutation, much less a viable response to method skeptics (For a more thorough post-Kuhnian response, see Schuster, 2024).
In an appendix, Dika dates the earliest entries to the Rules not to 1619–20 as nearly all contemporary commentators have held post Weber’s and Schuster’s developmental thesis, but to sometime between 1626–29 (333–336). Dika provides plausible arguments. Nevertheless, his late composition thesis is in tension with Descartes’s intellectual autobiography. In the Discourse, Descartes dates his development of the method to the winter of 1619, specifically mentioning the “coronation of the emperor,” Ferdinand II, which dates to this period (AT 6:11; CSM 1:116).
Dika’s Descartes’s Method is an interesting, thought-provoking, and exceptional volume. His ingenious habitus model of Descartes’s method provides perhaps the most comprehensive explanation of the method in the literature. This publication, along with the recently published Cambridge Manuscript, will spark much needed research and debate on Descartes’s early philosophy, especially his method.
REFERENCES
Jean-Paul Weber, La constitution du texte des “Regulae,” Paris: Société d’édition d'enseignement supérieur, 1964, ch. 1.
John A. Shuster, “Descartes’ Mathesis Universalis, 1619–28,” in Descartes: Philosophy, Mathematics and Physics, ed. Stephen Gaukroger, Sussex: Harvester Press, 1980.
John A. Schuster, Descartes–Agonistes: Physico-Mathematics, Method and Corpuscular-Mechanism, 1618–1633, Dordrecht: Springer, 2013, chs. 3 and 5.
René Descartes, Regulae ad directionem ingenii: an early manuscript version. Introduced, Edited, and Translated by Richard Serjeantson and Michael Edwards, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2023, 55–60.
John A. Schuster, “The Discovery of the Century—An Early Version of Descartes’ Regulae: More Questions than Answers?” review of René Descartes: Regulae ad Directionem Ingenii, An Early Manuscript Version, Introduced, Edited and Translated by Richard Serjeantson and Michael Edwards, History of European Ideas, 2023,1–8.
Gaston Bachelard, The New Scientific Spirit, Boston: Beacon Press, 1984.
Alexandre Koyré, Galileo Studies, New Jersey: Humanities Press, 1978.
Thomas Kuhn, The Structure of Scientific Revolutions, Chicago: Chicago University Press, 1962.
Paul Feyerabend, Against Method: Outline of an Anarchistic Theory of Knowledge, New York: Verso Books, 1993.
John A. Schuster, “Heroic Resuscitation? An Attempt to Revive Descartes’ Method,” review of Descartes’s Method: The Formation of the Subject of Science, by Tarek R. Dika, Annals of Science, 2024, 1–11.