Frans Svensson’s Descartes’s Moral Perfectionism is a welcome addition to a topic that deserves greater attention. The book makes significant contributions to our understanding of Descartes’s ethics, which should be of interest to Descartes scholars of all stripes, as Descartes’s work on ethics was not a side project, but rather integrated into his comprehensive philosophical system. While the book engages with the scholarly literature, it is also sufficiently accessible, direct, and brief to serve as an introduction to Descartes’s ethics for the uninitiated. As the title indicates, the book’s thesis is that Descartes should be categorized as a kind of moral perfectionist. While Svensson sometimes makes use of categories and concepts from contemporary ethical theory, the book is focused on understanding Descartes rather than bringing Descartes’s ethics into dialogue with perfectionism in ethics today or in the history of ethics more broadly.
The first chapter offers an interpretation of Descartes’s theory of value. This makes perhaps the most important contribution to the literature on Descartes’s ethical theory. While Descartes’s understanding of value is foundational to his other ethical claims, it has received scant attention, primarily because Descartes says so little about it. Svensson, however, admirably reconstructs a Cartesian theory that should be a starting point for subsequent research on this important topic. According to Svensson, Descartes identifies goodness with perfection: all goodness is a kind of perfection and vice versa. Svensson offers a novel interpretation of what, for Descartes, makes anything good and perfect. According to Svensson, a common interpretation of Descartes holds that goodness and perfection are determined by a thing’s characteristic or essential desires and passions. According to this view, things are good for humans if they satisfy essential human desires. The difficulty with this view, according to Svensson, is that Descartes often evaluates whether our desires are warranted in a way that presupposes some way of accounting for their value that stands independently of our desiring them.
In developing his alternative explanation of what makes something good and perfect, Svensson makes much use of a letter to Christina, where Descartes considers the goodness of each thing considered in itself and considered in relation to things. Svensson looks to Descartes’s claims about goodness considered in itself to provide a basic theory of Cartesian goodness and perfection, which Svensson uses to anchor Descartes’s claims about goodness and perfection in other contexts. According to this theory, things are good in themselves in virtue of possessing certain essential attributes or qualities. For instance, God is good and perfect in virtue of possessing the divine attributes. Human goodness and perfection derive from possessing certain essential human attributes or qualities.
Svensson’s reading here makes an excellent start in constructing a Cartesian theory of value, but the resulting theory is sketchy, raising some difficult questions that are unexplored by Descartes. Svensson deserves credit for revealing these questions for future research, though he does not take them up in the book. According to Svensson’s reading, the perfection of anything depends on its essence, but it is not clear how Descartes understands the essence of individual things, including individual human beings. Descartes famously rejects Aristotelian forms, which were the main way of explaining the essences of things in the scholastic tradition. This leaves Descartes’s metaphysics with a gap that he is famously unclear about how to fill. Svensson assumes—because Descartes’s ethics appears to assume—that human beings have an essence and that individual human beings have individual essences, which involves the essential properties of thought and extension and their union, manifested or expressed in distinctive ways. The first difficult question is how to square this conception of essences with Descartes’s broader metaphysics.
A further difficult question for Svensson’s interpretation of Descartes’s theory of value is precisely how essential properties are supposed to contribute to a thing’s perfection. On Svensson’s interpretation, merely possessing essential properties contributes to a thing’s perfection or goodness. Since Descartes holds that it increases our perfection to possess a greater degree of being or reality (13), does this imply that larger things are more perfect because they have more extension and, thus, greater being or reality? Furthermore, is it enough to merely possess an essential human property, or does perfection also consist in acting in ways that somehow promote the essential property? Suppose that human beings are partly defined by the quality of, say, digesting food in a particular way and, thus, having a digestive tract with a certain composition and extension; some form of this quality is essential because without it, a thing could not count as a human being. On Svensson’s interpretation, this would seem to imply that possessing a digestive tract contributes to a thing’s perfection. Does this mean that using this tract by digesting food makes us more perfect or that people whose digestive tracts are more powerful or efficient have greater perfection? Perhaps this is how Descartes understands health, which is why he classifies health as a perfection. Does this imply that it promotes our perfection to perform well our characteristic activities? In that case, how do we assess performing well?
While some of these details in Svensson’s interpretation of Descartes’s theory remain unclear, the main conclusions are not. Human goods and perfections fall into two main categories: intellectual (free will, virtue, knowledge) and bodily (health, strength, perhaps beauty). Chapter 1 uses this interpretation of Cartesian goodness and perfection to explain Descartes’s various claims about the highest good. Most importantly, when Descartes claims that the highest good is virtue—at least, the highest good attainable in this life—he means that possessing virtue implies the highest degree of overall perfection that is possible for oneself. While there are other goods, like health or friendship, for Descartes, these are so much less valuable than virtue that their presence could never compensate for a loss in one’s virtue.
After briefly considering Descartes’s general account of the will, Chapter 2 offers an interpretation of Descartes’s account of virtue as a firm and constant resolution to choose (a) to form the most considered judgments about what would be best to do and then (b) to act accordingly. This interpretation addresses what is widely perceived as a serious problem with Descartes’s ethical theory. Deborah Brown articulates the problem roughly as follows. Cartesian virtue amounts to a good or well-directed will, but Descartes doesn’t fully explain how a good will is directed because he fails to explain what is good apart from being the object of a good will. Svensson answers firstly that virtue is a second-order good in the sense that virtue consists in responding in a certain way to first-order goods. Svensson responds secondly by pointing to the account of the first-order goods that he provided in the first chapter (health, strength, knowledge, and so forth). Whether the reader is satisfied by this response depends on how satisfied the reader is with Svensson’s interpretation from chapter 1.
In chapter 2, Svensson emphasizes Descartes’s claim that a good will does not require perfect knowledge of the right course of action. Rather, a good will is directed to the best course of action given the person’s fallible and possibly wrong best understanding of how to act. This claim increases the palatability of Descartes’s Stoic claim that virtue is always within our power, a view that has often been met with skepticism. On Svensson’s reading, if one has done one’s best to discover what would be the best course of action, then one has met the requirements of virtue. Given the immense value of virtue, the virtuous course of action is the best, which means that one has acted the best, even if her best understanding turns out to be incorrect.
Chapter 3 defends the book’s primary thesis that Descartes’s ethics is a form of moral perfectionism. While the term “moral perfectionism” can be understood in a variety of ways, Svensson uses it to refer to moral theories that (a) uphold perfectionist theories of value and (b) take perfection to be what makes right conduct (79). Because of (b), Svensson identifies moral perfectionism with a particular way of explaining our reasons to be virtuous: we should be virtuous because this promotes our perfection.
Svensson contrasts this perfectionist reading with both a more Stoic and more Epicurean reading of Descartes’s moral philosophy. According to the former, defended by Lisa Shapiro and Noa Naaman-Zauderer, the reason to be virtuous is the Stoic view that virtue is the only unqualified good, whereas other goods are merely preferred indifferents. Svensson responds that his perfectionist interpretation better explains Descartes’s view that what is virtuous for any individual varies depending on her individual traits, such as her capacities or knowledge. According to Svensson, Descartes is committed to this individual variation in virtue because he holds that virtue consists in increasing our perfection, and each individual is perfected in different ways. According to the latter Epicurean view, defended by Martial Gueroult, our reason to be virtuous is that virtue promotes our happiness. Svensson offers several objections to the Epicurean view, a main one being that it implies that happiness is our highest good, which Descartes explicitly rejects.
The subject of happiness is the focus of chapter 4. According to Svensson, Descartes understands happiness as the satisfaction or contentment that is a habit of the soul identified with tranquility or peace of mind. Svensson emphasizes that this definition of happiness makes it an all or nothing affair, not admitting of degrees. According to Svensson, happiness, for Descartes, qualifies as a good and a perfection, although Descartes does not explicitly describe it in this way. Svensson argues that virtue is necessary for happiness because only the well-directed will produces the satisfaction of knowing that one has acted as well as possible, but virtue is not always sufficient for happiness because one may lack the wisdom that allows her to experience satisfaction with her actions, even if they were the best possible.
Chapter 5 turns to generosity, the hallmark virtue of Cartesian ethics. For Descartes, generosity is both a virtue and a passion, specifically a kind of self-esteem directed at our will. In the secondary literature, it is often held that self-esteem is warranted by the proper direction of our will, but Svensson makes the case that self-esteem is also warranted merely by the possession of a will, the human power that most resembles God. Svensson argues that the virtue of generosity has a special connection to happiness. While virtue is not a sufficient condition for happiness generally, the virtue of generosity is. This is because the virtue consists partly in the knowledge that nothing truly belongs to a person but the freedom to dispose one’s volitions and, thus, that one ought to be praised and blamed for no reason other than how one uses this freedom. This knowledge guarantees that a virtuous person will possess the lasting tranquility of knowing that one has done her best. The chapter also explains Descartes’s view of how we acquire generosity and how it affords control over the passions.
The final chapter considers how Descartes’s ethics of generosity relates to two other ethical theories that he mentions at various points: the highest and most perfect morality, mentioned in the French preface to the Principles, and the provisional morality mentioned in the Discourse on Method. Svensson defends the view that the virtue of generosity fits the bill for the perfect morality, in opposition to Gueroult, who supposes that the perfect morality depends on a perfect system of knowledge that is unavailable to us. Svensson also shows how Descartes’s ethics of generosity could plausibly be the result of applying his early philosophical method, advertised but largely unexplained in the Discourse. This explains how the virtue of generosity is an example of the moral code that Descartes discusses in the Discourse.
In summary, this book is highly recommended as a resource for students and Descartes researchers.