In his deeply interesting new book, Frederick Neuhouser expands the discussion of normative political theory beyond the confines of the pillars that have served as the foci of recent American political theory: justice, social welfare, and moral responsibility. Neuhouser argues that human society is sufficiently comparable to living organisms, and that the notion of social pathology is relevant to the understanding of human society. Neuhouser brings the scrupulousness, care, and methodological assumptions of contemporary analytic political philosophy to themes in social and political thought that have been largely alien to its deeply rooted methodological individualism. The theme of social pathology is one that is central to Plato’s Republic and a theme that Plato takes up from the Greek Sophists and from Thucydides. Thus, the notion of social pathology is not a new theme. Especially in his Republic, Plato developed an extremely rich and subtle systematic diagnosis of the causes of social and individual psychopathology. Plato’s account of psychic health and psychopathology culminates in a systematic theory of how even the kallipolis must degenerate in stages from the self-rule of true aristocratic philosopher kings and their commitment to the individual and common good to the rule of ever baser and more divisive desires in democracy and tyranny.
Neuhouser develops a generally formal but illuminating account of psychological health and pathology in society. In a healthy society, the parts must function together to contribute to the whole. Social pathology arises when the parts of society fail to function effectively together. Organisms are characterized by organs with proper functions that contribute to the life of the whole organism. The functioning of an organism is to be understood in holistic terms. The actions of the organism are expressions of the functioning of the whole organism rather than the mere aggregation of what its parts are doing. Like organisms, human societies sustain themselves by reproducing the material conditions under which they live and function. Reproduction of material conditions is necessary to the survival of organisms. Reproduction of material conditions is also necessary to the function and survival of human societies. Human society is however characterized by more than mere survival; each human society is characterized by a certain conception of what a worthwhile life looks like, and that includes a certain conception of what is involved in being recognized by others and in having the freedom to realize that which makes life worthwhile. That self-understanding is grounded in our practices. Neuhouser puts vitality and the tension between life and culture front and center in his account of a healthy society. This has fruitful resonances with the philosophy of life in the early twentieth century, especially the work of Georg Simmel, as well as to Hegel and Friedrich Hölderlin.
Neuhouser dispenses with any robust commitment to a teleological narrative structure to history and with it any robust commitment to teleology in organic processes. He emphasizes the role of function and the relevance of function to social health and social pathology. His objections to teleology in organic process and in human social and cultural history are compelling given his assumptions. However, the etiological conception of function according to which a function is to be understood in terms of what causes it allows an unproblematic commitment to a kind of teleology in organic process. Neuhouser’s own idea that the parts of a society should not be viewed in abstraction from one another falls well short of the kind of systematic organic unity in which the whole of nature and of society are to be constituted as wholes in which the wholes are reciprocal causes of the parts and vice versa (31). Neuhouser correctly attributes to Kant the much stronger claim, and I think one can also claim that the stronger conception is present in Plato, Aristotle, and Hegel, as well. Unlike authors from Plato to Rousseau, Kant, Hegel, Marx, Theodor Adorno and Axel Honneth, Neuhouser does not endeavor to provide a systematic conception of social pathology.
Neuhouser emphasizes and endorses a functionalism that he traces back to Plato’s Republic. But Neuhouser’s functionalism and social holism is much thinner than that of Plato, Aristotle or German idealism. Neuhouser takes functionalism to maintain that institutions cannot function except marginally independently of each other and of their cooperation within the whole of society. There is a looseness of fit in Neuhouser’s conception. The individual starts from a relatively independent sense of self in his conception and comes to participate in institutions that are at least relatively independent of each other but that, he argues, need to cohere if society is to be healthy and successful.
In the Republic, Plato argued from the start that individuals need proper philosophical training to overcome a pathological individualism of choice made in isolation from an understanding of the common welfare. This is a precondition for a healthy community, a healthy polis. German thinkers from Leibniz to Hegel and Ernst Cassirer saw themselves as executing this vision of a healthy society but not at the price of the curtailment of individual freedom and rights. Indeed, Cassirer argued in 1928 in celebration of the German Republican constitution that the German philosophical tradition was characterized by a celebration of individual human freedom and individual human rights together with a commitment to the social welfare of all that could not be sustained in Rousseau’s work.
Some of the very virtues of Neuhouser’s analysis prevent him from providing a truly systematic account of social pathology. His departure from the fundamental and methodologically isolated individualism of the Anglo-American liberal tradition is not as fundamental as it might be. Ultimately, he seems to think of individuality and social connection as only loosely connected to each other. This allows him to argue that “the conceptions of human society espoused by Marx, Plato, Rousseau, Durkheim and Hegel—as well as John Searle and Vincent Descombes—converge (or can, without interpretive violence, be made to converge) into a general conception of the kind of thing human society is” (346). Conversely, the notion of social health and social pathology available on this thin conception of human society does not allow for as systematic a treatment of social health and social pathology as the one that Plato provides.
Neuhouser’s conception of social health (in contrast to social pathology) accords with a conception of society that leaves out the substantial differences between the conception of healthy social function in Plato and Hegel in contrast to Searle’s methodologically individualistic conception of the social. By contrast, I take the central position of German philosophy from Kant forward to be that all freedom is social but also individual and involves a transformation of individual and society that must occur together to eliminate both the sense of alienation and the loss of self that can otherwise occur. Freedom, for (at least the late) Kant and for German idealism, is what Plato in the Republic calls a turning around of the whole soul to the idea of the good. This does not have to come at the loss of individuality or of one’s full integrity as a person. Rather, it is arguably the basis for the only true form of individual authenticity and individuality. I do not take Searle’s conception of that which is social to be consistent with such a conception of psychological and social health.
Neuhouser’s starting point can be illustrated by reference to his excellent work: Rousseau's Theodicy of Self-Love: Evil, Rationality, and the Drive for Recognition (Cambridge, 2010). Neuhouser established the importance in that work of Rousseau’s amour propre in the genesis of the desire for recognition by other human beings. In this way, Neuhouser was able to show that a certain dimension of the conception of mutual recognition in Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit (at least as it is understood by Alexandre Kojève) is anticipated not only in Fichte and in Kant but also already in Rousseau. For Rousseau, the need for recognition is a condition of nearly everything that elevates human life above mere animal existence. Rationality, morality, freedom, the very distinctive form of subjectivity that is distinctively human is only possible for us because of amour propre. The agonistic relations to others instigated in human civilization, culture, and history by amour propre contrast with amour de soi, a natural self-consciousness independent of culture. The amour propre manifested in pride and vanity gives rise to the worst forms of human conflict. Amour propre engenders alienation, vice, war and encourages the enslaving of others. Neuhouser shows that overcoming these massive and endemic problems of human civilization and achieving unalienated selfhood and human freedom depends for Rousseau on cultivating rather than suppressing the drive for recognition. This also accords with Alexandre Kojève’s fundamentally desire-based reading of Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit, according to which human beings are not only characterized by desire, but also by the desire to be desired by others, a desire that expresses itself as the desire for recognition and that is the motor for human history. Kojève’s reading of Hegel makes desire and the desire for recognition central to Hegel. I would argue that Kojève’s reading of Hegel is itself pathologically individualistic. It presents Hegel’s trajectory towards the overcoming of alienation and integration into a wider sense of self and belonging from the vantage point of alienated and pathological individualism.
The evidence for a desire for recognition in Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit is not strong, however popular that reading of Hegel is and has been. However, such a theme does come up in Kant, where it has its source in Rousseau. This is especially evident in his Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View (which expresses the whole trajectory of Kant’s reception of Rousseau from the pre-critical period to The Conflict of the Faculties, Kant’s final published work). In the desire for recognition by others, Kant sees not only the motor for social conflict, for the development of technology, and for war but also especially the source of fashion (and hence in taste) in all its forms. Fashion is for Kant the desire to be recognized for one’s taste. One seeks this recognition by emulating those whom one regards as superior in status and who thus set the social standard of taste (Anthropology §71). For Kant, such desire for recognition prepares the way for the sociability that presupposes freedom (§67). But fashion remains embedded in the alienation of internalized dominance relations that lead one to decorate (even one’s own house) only to impress others (and not even for the appreciation of one’s children or of one’s wife) (§67). These dominance relations in the family structure and elsewhere and their reflection in fashion have a long history. Even Plato thought that to remove alienation at least for those who would serve the polis, fashion and even the family ought ideally to be abolished, but that such extreme measures are not workable. The Kantian and Hegelian tradition strive (however imperfectly) to overcome alienation without the abolition of fashion and the family. Abolition of fashion and family creates social pathology rather than leading to its elimination. Kant, the German idealists, and the Romantics strive to maintain the full integrated structure of the individual and society but in a manner that provides a revolution in the identity of the individual and society.
Neuhouser’s inclusions are impressive. There is a discussion of Plato, Rousseau, Hegel, Marx, Auguste Comte, Herbert Spencer, Durkheim, and even of Searle and Descombes. Honneth’s discussion of social pathology is especially relevant to Neuhouser. Honneth took up the theme of social pathology from the early Frankfurt School and endeavored to articulate and defend it against Jürgen Habermas, emphasizing the notion of successful recognition for social health and failed mutual recognition for social pathology. According to Honneth, Hegel and the early Frankfurt School diagnose the pathologies of a fundamentally individualistic conception of individual freedom (one to which Habermas comes to be committed). In The Pathologies of Individual Freedom: Hegel's Social Theory (Princeton Monographs in Philosophy, 30, 2016), Honneth interprets Hegel’s Philosophy of Right as a diagnosis of the pathologies involved in the modern (and especially Anglo-American) overemphasis on individual freedom. Hegel argues that people must also find their freedom or “self-realization” through shared projects. Such projects involve the three fundamental institutional structures that constitute the social structure of ethical life: the family, civil society, and the state. Ethical life provides the basis for a kind of freedom that Honneth takes to be important in addition to the personal and moral freedom established by the structure of abstract right and morality as Hegel lays it out in his Philosophy of Right. Honneth calls this form of freedom “communicative” freedom, developing an idea from Karl Jaspers and Michael Theunissen. A society is just only if it gives all its members sufficient and equal opportunity to realize communicative freedom as well as personal and moral freedom. Individual and social pathology result if there is not sufficient “space” for communicative as well as personal and moral freedom, but also a social commitment to its value.
Honneth argues that an overcommitment to individual freedom is at the basis of the political philosophy both of Rawls and of Habermas. In agreement with Honneth, I would argue that their accounts are—despite a central interest in the social—fundamentally methodologically individualistic. Although they emphasize a rich conception of social identity and of social practices, they work from a conception of at least in principle isolatable individuals with preferences that one can make sense of in isolation (cf. Rawls’ conception of the original position of rational choice works from the methodological individualism of rational choice theory). Neuhouser is not altogether free from the assumption of the Rawlsian liberal tradition that individuals and institutions should be taken in some sense to be intelligible in relative isolation from each other.
For Honneth, Hegel's theory contains an account of the psychological damage caused by adopting the more individualistic conception and placing too much emphasis on the freedom of the person to make choices (abstract right) and in the autonomy of moral freedom (morality). Although these freedoms are crucial to the achievement of justice, they also leave individuals in society vulnerable to alienation. I would argue that the diagnosis of social pathology in Hegel is much less a focus than the systematic development of a healthy conception of the individual in national and world-community within the framework of his own place in time. But if we take Hegel’s work and its effort to identify and overcome the sources of alienation, then we can understand it as a systematic account of the genesis of individual and social pathology and the process of overcoming that pathology. It is very much a systematic development of Plato’s account on the basis of more Kantian assumptions.
I read Kant, Marx, Simmel, and more recently, Kōjin Karatani also as developing an account of individual and social pathology (Karatani has developed a suggestive synthesis of Kant and Marx beginning with his book Transcritique: Kant and Marx, Sabu Kohso trans. (Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 2005) a work that was in turn taken up by Slavoj Žižek, The Parallax View (Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 2010)). A systematic trajectory leads individuals to forms of social relations that involve dominance and self-isolation and also toward a conception of social and political relations that does not involve giving up individuality but takes individual and social health to emerge systematically together in forms of social relations that do not juxtapose the individual’s care for self to the individual’s relation to a dynamic and healthy social whole.
Neuhouser rightly avoids theories that attempt to specify the good of society independently of the good of its individual members (350). It is less clear to me that a conception of a healthy and non-pathological society should therefore have a looser conception of fit than that of a healthy biological organism (or of the Kantian kingdom of ends): “Members of a human society enjoy greater existential and normative independence from the whole to which they belong than do the parts of a biological organism: human individuals, once produced, can live longer in isolation than a heart torn from its animal body, and more importantly, their good is not simply identical with conceptually determined by—the good of their society” (350).
Rousseau, Kant, Hegel, and even Marx can be taken to assign a narrative structure to history that is always a function of where we are and what our fundamental concerns as agents are insofar as we actively participate in a healthy community. In this conception, our sense of self is only authentic when we can see ourselves in what we do as part of a greater whole to which we are contributing. This is what I also take Marx’s historical materialism, a materialism of practices, rather than of bits of matter, structurally to express. Marx criticizes the “German ideology” that takes our fundamentally social practices to be mere expressions of our self-conscious representations rather than the other way around.
The defeat of Athens and the downfall of the Athenian empire in the Peloponnesian War invited philosophical reflection by Thucydides and Plato on the social and cultural as well as political and military causes of decline. Thucydides saw decline especially in the cynical exercise of power, Plato in a concern for apparent individual welfare over an understanding of true individual and social welfare and health. Catastrophic defeats have raised these questions throughout history in different cultures. A comprehensive and systematic account of the role of social pathology in different cultures, including its relation to colonialism, and to social, political, and economic evolution and revolution would be deeply interesting. Our own current political situation invites reflection on the nature and sources of such social pathology. And Frederick Neuhouser is to be congratulated for bringing so carefully and soberly to our attention the fine-grained analysis that social pathology demands.