Do Numbers Exist? A Debate about Abstract Objects

This exchange is published in the Routledge series, Little Debates about Big Questions. Routledge characterises the intent of the series as comprising “Short, lively and accessible debates. . .[showcasing] diverse and deep answers. Pedagogical features include standard form arguments, section summaries, bolded key terms and principles, glossaries, and annotated reading lists.”

Readers should accordingly be advised that this book actually offers not a “little debate” but a ramified exchange over some 275 pages, comprising three phases: an extended opening statement by each protagonist, a first round of replies by each, and then a second round of replies to the replies. With Mark Balaguer’s useful twenty page Foreword, the book as a whole exceeds 300 quite densely argued pages.

“Lively” it certainly is. But I would be cautious about “accessible”. While both discussants do regularly pause their essays to include instances of the various “pedagogical features” cited, the book is likely to prove quite a challenging undertaking for the majority of lay readers and although it can be recommended as background reading for philosophy courses for sophomores or majors, I would expect it to present quite a steep climb even for them. Moreover the various moves and countermoves on display are by no means representative of the full range of proposals exemplified in the recent literature on the topic. There are two conspicuous omissions, more on which below.

The title of the book is a tad misleading. For although the status of (our apparent commitment to) the objects of mathematics is indeed a prominent issue for the exchange, and at the later stages becomes its main preoccupation, Peter van Inwagen at least initially is equally concerned with abstracta in general, including under that heading both properties and propositions. This may occasion some unease among readers of a Fregean and/or Quinean orientation—and did so for the present reviewer—for whom the distinction between abstract objects properly so regarded, and other kinds of non-objectual abstracta is of metaphysical significance. In his Grundlagen, Frege stressed that in order for it to be appropriate to think of something as being an object of some kind, we need to understand what is usually now termed a criterion of identity for it. We need to grasp both what kind of thing it is and what distinguishes it from all other things of the same kind. The point was reemphasized by Quine in his slogan, “No entity without identity”. The issue is significant because it emerges that one prime motivation for William Craig’s scepticism about abstracta, or more specifically, his scepticism about the ontological implications of what superficially appear to be natural language occurrences of existential quantification and singular reference, derives from our casual readiness to apply apparent such devices to talk of things like shadows, paths to righteousness, and ways of driving to John O’Groats, where despite the possibility of, for example, apparent numerically specific existential generalisations—“There are four ways of avoiding the local black fly bites”—no solid notion of re-identification is to hand. English does indeed abound with what we might call casual nominalizations. They are distinguished from serious object-invoking talk by the latter’s passing the Frege/Quine test and by the richness of the proprietary vocabulary applicable to examples of prima facie objects in cases where Platonism becomes a philosophically serious proposal. Significant platonist/anti-platonist debate does well not to focus on the low-hanging fruit.

As is familiar, the recent debates about abstract objects have largely been fuelled by perceived tensions between their acausality and certain prevalent trends in the theory of knowledge which, whatever their differences of detail, are unified by the idea that the acquisition of knowledge about entities of whatever kind must ultimately depend upon the possibility of some kind of (distal) interaction with them or sensitivity to their effects. That is certainly an active point in the present exchange. But a special edge is given to it by both participants’ acceptance of the idea of the aseity of the God of their faith—the idea that God, and God alone, is the source of absolutely everything else, the sole uncaused entity.

There are indeed two points of tension between this conception of the Almighty and the admission of abstracta. First, if abstracta do not, as a matter of their essential nature, participate in causal relations either as causes or caused, then they cannot be caused to exist, even by God. And hence, if it is granted that they do exist, then there are things that are not the product of His agency. Second, if abstracta do exist, then—as usually conceived—at least those of pure mathematics, and perhaps also (some) properties and propositions, exist necessarily. But this necessity would appear to set a limit on the power of God: the world would necessarily contain entities whose existence or non-existence would lie outside the domain of things that God can bring about.

Craig has a prima facie briskly efficient response to these tensions, for his view is straightforwardly that there are no abstracta. However, readers may feel, matters cannot be quite so simple, since the question must then arise whether their non-existence is a matter of contingency or necessity. If the former, then abstracta could have existed, and if they had, presumably that would either have been as an effect of the will of God—contrary to their acausality—or independently of His will, contrary to His aseity. On the other hand, if abstracta necessarily don’t exist, that necessity may be construed as marking a limitation on God’s powers: He cannot make it otherwise

Van Inwagen, in accepting the necessary existence of at least some abstracta, needs anyway to take a different line. His view is that the traditional conception of God’s aseity derives from the writings of the early Fathers of the Church and the explicit assertion of that conception therein, and thus very likely originated in their utter conceptual innocence of the category of abstracta. Accordingly, when they proclaimed God as the sole uncaused entity, the implicit quantification involved must be understood to exclude categories of entities beyond the understanding of their time. Well, maybe. But again, readers may be unclear how that’s supposed to help. For we do have such a concept, and the question therefore arises how, in light of that, should the traditional notion of God’s aseity now be modified in order best to incorporate the spirit of the Fathers’ conception?

And besides all that, the question still remains, how to understand the absolute necessities of logic, mathematics and other areas if they are not to be conceived as limitations on His power?

In the remainder of this review, I set these theological issues aside, since there is plenty in the exchange of relevance to readers with a more purely secular interest in the metaphysical and epistemological issues about abstracta—or more specifically, about abstract objects. In fact, the discussion in the book moves fairly quickly to the question, what should be the measure of ontological commitment: what kinds of assertion, made with full seriousness, should be taken to commit an agent to the existence of abstract entities of a certain kind? Van Inwagen’s view is prima facie broadly Quinean: commitment is entrained by assertion involving quantification over entities of the relevant kind and/or by singular reference to them (ignoring here the point that Quine himself regarded the latter as eliminable in favour of quantification.) However there is a wrinkle: for van Inwagen, such locutions are committal only when made inside what he calls the “Ontology Room”. It would be beyond the scope of this review to venture an account of what exactly van Inwagen intends by this metaphor. The interested reader should consult his 2014 paper “Inside and Outside the Ontology Room”. But at the risk of oversimplifying, it seems he wants to allow for ‘non-committal’ but nevertheless literal such assertions—they become committal only when made with a certain gravity and metaphysical intent in a regimented first-order language. His principal argument that we are indeed so committed to the objects of mathematics is a version of the so-called Indispensability Argument, but envisaged as put forward inside the Ontology Room.

Craig for his part simply rejects the Quinean account of ontological commitment. Even the ‘serious’ assertion of extensional claims involving singular terms and apparent existential quantification are simply not ontologically committing, in his view. The truth of “Pegasus could fly” is consistent with there never having been any such beast. It may be that a more assiduous reading of his chapters would disclose a clearer idea than this reviewer was able to garner of what exactly Craig takes to be the measure of genuine ontological commitment.

Philosophically less experienced readers may be puzzled that, when the issue for debate has been identified as whether abstracta, or more specifically numbers, exist, the protagonists spend most of their effort on the question of whether certain things we habitually say should be regarded as committing us to their existence. Part of the explanation, of course, is there is no such thing as stumbling across an abstract object—as one might, for example, stumble across a black swan on the banks of the Murray river in SE Australia, or a hitherto botanically undocumented species of orchid in Suffolk. Rather, when numbers, for example, are concerned, the question of existence needs to be understood as a theoretical question, in such a way that the question of commitment comes first: are we—or perhaps should we be—theoretically committed to the existence of numbers, and are the theories in question good, for whatever purpose—or perhaps even unavoidable?

This is the context of the Indispensability Argument, a version of which, as far as the credibility of mathematical objects is concerned, is, as stated, van Inwagen’s principal go-to consideration in support of his Platonism. The argument, originally due to Quine, has of course received a variety of formulations in the literature but for the purposes of the present exchange, the basic ideas are two: first (1), that certain mathematical theories—by no means all (Cantorian transfinite set theory is, for example, excluded) but including number theory and real and complex analysis—are indispensable to currently developed physical theory, whose truth, it is concluded, therefore implicates that of the mathematical theories concerned; second (2), the truth of those mathematical theories naturally implies the real existence of their various proprietary abstract ontological commitments.

Craig rejects both claim (1) and claim (2). Against (1), and throughout the exchange, he repeatedly canvasses the possibility of various non-realist construals of the practice of pure mathematics, including various forms of fictionalism, ‘figuralism’ (see Yablo 2001), and ‘if-then’-ism, finally boldly asserting among the “safe conclusions” (240) of the entire exchange that “there are legitimate ways of understanding mathematical discourse as figurative or make-believe and, hence, ontologically non-committing” (240).

While, however, it is certainly true that there is no shortage in the literature of philosophical attempts to make good on broad forms of anti-realism about mathematics of these kinds, the question any such tendency has to address is: what ground can it give us for confidence that inferences among non-mathematical statements that are mediated by theses of mathematics, so conceived, will prove truth-preserving? As an analogy, it would be reckless in the extreme to utilise statements of the best Dickensian novels to mediate inferences among propositions concerning the actual sociology of Victorian London.

Craig’s answer to this challenge is very simple: it is that the best explanation for why inferences mediated by fictional mathematics among scientific statements might nevertheless be truth-preserving is the existence of the Almighty, who presumably would not allow the faithful to be badly deceived in their scientific practices. Van Inwagen, good theist though he is, implicitly rejects this answer, holding that it is the truth of those mathematical theories that are utilised in science that provides the best explanation of their successful application.

I earlier mentioned that, as a guide to the topography of the recent and contemporary debates concerning mathematical ontology, this exchange involves two notable omissions. The first is the absence from the cast of authorities discussed here who reject claim (1) of Hartry Field. Science without Numbers pioneered the thought that what is minimally necessary for confidence in mathematics in application is not the truth of its theses but their truth–preservingness—more specifically, their conservativeness in Field’s technical sense^[1]—in inference among non-mathematical statements. It is surprising to read van Inwagen investing so much in the Indispensability Argument without any comment on this strategy. It is also surprising that Craig appears to invest as much as he does in fictional or figurative interpretations of mathematics, when, as he is well aware (though he gives it only a brief mention), there are ready to hand modal and structuralist interpretations of the key theories which aim to safeguard their truth without incurring platonist ontological commitments. How successful these approaches are is of course up for further discussion, but that discussion should surely have taken priority over reliance on proposals that construe mathematics as a kind of make-believe.

Actually it never became fully clear, to this reader at least, why exactly Craig so mistrusts abstracta. There is the suggestion, mentioned earlier, that so long as we follow Quine, as van Inwagen does, in regarding existential quantification as the vehicle of ontological commitment, we will be saddled with a commitment not just to the traditional abstracta of pure mathematics but to any number of frivolous and incredible examples. But this is to misrepresent both those authors. Quine proposes such a criterion only after ‘regimentation’ of the language in question, and van Inwagen will insist that we be in the Ontology Room before it is applied.

The second notable omission I referred to is that neither author disputant engages properly with the now quite extensive literature on the issues concerning abstract objects that pursues the insights of Frege. Here is the closest they come to it. On page 198 Craig writes that

It needs to be appreciated in this connection that van Inwagen is, in spite of his claims, a heavyweight Platonist in the sense that he thinks that abstract objects are just as real as anything else. It is without ontological significance that on his view abstract objects are essentially causally effete. . . .What matters is that unlike truly lightweight Platonists, such as Michael Dummett, Bob Hale and Crispin Wright, who deny that abstracta exist in the same robust sense that indisputably existent objects exist, van Inwagen maintains that the predicate “exists" is univocal and that therefore abstract objects are just as real as anything else that truly exists. Abstract objects are for van Inwagen as real as elementary particles, people, and God himself.

This actually misrepresents my own view. It is the objects that, on the neo-Fregean view, properly understood, are lightweight, not the sense in which they exist. But in any case, van Inwagen wants none of it. Here is his response:

Dummett, Hale, and Wright are not lightweight Platonists. They're not lightweight Platonists because they’re not Platonists of any kind. They're not Platonists of any kind because every kind of Platonism is a philosophical position and they have no position. They have no position because the words they use when they claim to be stating their position are meaningless. (219)

Had van Inwagen seen fit to dismount his high horse for a moment to attempt to substantiate the final claim, I would certainly have felt impelled to respond. As it is, I merely remark that, in view of the extent, quality, and intensity of the recent debates concerning the neo-Fregean conception of abstracta, their neglect here is, from the point of view of scholars interested in the metaphysical issues, perhaps the most disappointing aspect of this book. What, in the opinion of this reviewer and many others, is some of the most interesting recent theorising about mathematical ontology, doesn’t get so much as a look in.

Let me, though, not conclude this brief review on a note of disappointment. Notwithstanding that van Inwagen’s and Craig’s to-and-fro is some significant distance from a fair reflection of the “state of the art” of the debates about mathematical objects and abstracta generally, students and other philosophers curious about the issues will be able to learn not a little from reading their spirited, occasionally edgy exchange. And when they are done, they can turn to chapter 14, “Abstract Objects”, of Michael Dummett’s masterly Frege: Philosophy of Language.

REFERENCES

Peter van Inwagen, “Inside and Outside the Ontology Room”, Introduction to his collection Existence: Essays in Ontology, Cambridge University Press (2014).

Yablo, Stephen, “Go figure: A path through fictionalism”, Midwest Studies in Philosophy 25 (1):72–102 (2001).

Hartry. Field, Science Without Numbers, Princeton University Press (1980).

M.A.E Dummett, Frege: Philosophy of Language, Duckworth/Harvard (1973).