Early German Positivism

Frederick C. Beiser’s Early German Positivism makes a welcome contribution to the study of German philosophy by introducing an underexplored part of the history of positivism, detailing its reception and development in the second half of the nineteenth century in Germany. The book expounds the thought of little-known positivist thinkers such as Eugen Dühring, Ernst Laas, and Friedrich Jodl, as well the better-known Richard Avenarius and the much better-known Ernst Mach. The book provides the background against which the distinctive features of later positivism become clearly visible.

Early German Positivism is organised in a clear and straightforward way. The introduction outlines the characteristic tenets of early positivism and relates it to the later positivism of the Vienna Circle. Chapter One discusses the reception of Comte and Mill in Austria and Germany. Franz Brentano’s engagement with Comte’s positivism and Theodor Gomperz, the translator of Mill, are introduced. Each of the following chapters is devoted to one main figure, and Beiser works through and, in part, translates the German source texts. I will take the chapters in order.

The introduction characterises early positivism as radical empiricism with a ‘social consciousness’: its philosophical criticism is in service of social and political reform (10). The epistemology of the early positivists is characterised as follows:

The central thesis of its epistemology is that all principles or propositions of any cognitive value about the world have to be derived from, and justified by, experience. (6)

This thesis gives rise to well-known questions. What is experience? Can one derive anything from an experience at all? No scientific law can be derived from experience. What about the central thesis itself? Is it a proposition of ‘any cognitive value about the world’? If it is, how can it be derived from experience? If not, is radical empiricism not just another dogma? One hopes that the early positivists have something to say about these issues.

Chapter Two is devoted to Eugen Dühring as ‘the first major thinker in the German positivist tradition’ (32). Beiser gives a helpful tour of Dühring’s main works and his debate with Friedrich Engels. According to Beiser, ‘What the logical positivist had only dreamed of in 1929 Dühring already carried out in 1875’ (47). What do the later Austro-German positivists dream of? A worldview based on science alone that eschews metaphysics. Dühring’s Cursus der Philosophie is supposed to deliver the goods (ibid); his 1878 Logik und Wissenschaftstheorie was supposed to provide the meta-theory for this view. However, if a worldview based on science alone was Dühring’s ambition, he seems to have failed already at the start of his Cursus (16). The book begins with what seems to be an a priori argument for the conclusion that ‘being’ is unique, roughly, that there is only one actual world, that draws on premises about the essence of thought.

Chapter Three expounds the positivism of Ernst Laas whose ‘great service to German philosophy—and it is still not fully honoured today—was to have imported Mill’s battle against intuitionism onto German soil’ (68). Laas followed Mill in holding that the view that there are a priori truths is a dangerous idea that leads to dogmatism (Mill’s term for this thesis was intuitionism). Laas therefore undertook ‘a search and destroy mission against intuitionism’ (68). His first target was Kant. In his Kants Analogien der Erfahrung, Laas worked in detail through the nitty-gritty of Kant’s arguments in the analogies of experience and found them wanting. But what distinguishes the empiricism of Mill and Laas from ‘bad’ intuitionism? Prima facie, the empiricist Laas put propositions about experience as the sole source of knowledge beyond all critique, while the intuitionists treated other propositions as beyond all critique. Laas seems not to have felt the force of this challenge.

Laas’s Idealismus und Positivismus (three volumes) aimed to give a historical foundation of positivism. Laas started in ancient philosophy and pitted the positivism of Protagoras against the idealism of Plato. (Later, the Vienna circle manifesto used Protagoras’s famous ‘Man is the measure of all things’ dictum to convey the general orientation of their philosophy.) Laas read Protagoras’s dictum in a specific epistemological way: Protagoras is the spiritual father of positivism because he highlighted the ‘obvious fact’ that objects are known only as objects of a subject’s consciousness; subjects only as something to which something appears (see Laas 1879 I, 176ff, he labelled this ‘fact’ correlationism). Similar claims are made by Jodl and Avenarius (Beiser, 212) and Schlick (1925, 201-2/1974, 217-188) discussed Avenarius and Laas in the same breath. On Schlick’s reading, correlationism (implausibly) identifies reality with the totality of the contents of consciousness. Schlick’s new positivism rejected this identification. Laas seems to confirm this reading when he related positivism to Hume. Beiser (77) translates the relevant quote as follows:

Just like Hume, the positivist sees in the ‘world’ nothing more than a totality of realities of sensation and perception, which totality exists for each sensing being only as long and so far as itself.

Fine, but an important word is missing: the positivist sees ‘in der ‘Welt’ nichts weiter als einen Inbegriff von Empfindungs- oder Wahrnehmungs-Wirklichkeiten und -Möglichkeiten.’ (Laas 1879 III, 46; my italics) On the next page the ‘Not-I’ is the ‘totality of possible sensations’ (Inbegriff möglicher Empfindungen). Hence, for Laas, the world is the totality of actual sensations, as well as possibilities of sensations. The existence of non-modal facts that ground these possibilities, argued Laas (III, 46), is superfluous for practical reasoning.

Beiser highlights Laas’s definition of positivism: positivism is the philosophy that ‘recognises no other foundations than positive facts, i.e. outer and inner perceptions’ (1879 I, 183, translated on 75). This definition is as clear as the concept of foundation it employs. In which sense of ‘foundation’ are perceptions foundations? And what are they foundations of? Laas (ibid.) continued by saying that positivism ‘demands of each opinion that it provides the facts on which it is based’. That sounds like a form of epistemic foundationalism. Five pages later, Laas says that the Sensualistische Fundamentalbehauptung is that thinking develops out of sensations, that there is only a gradual difference between thought and sensation. How are these conceptions of ‘foundation’ related to each other?

Chapter Four introduces the work of Viennese philosopher Friedrich Jodl. The Vienna Circle manifesto described him as cultivating the ‘anti-metaphysical spirit’ in Vienna. Beiser focusses on Jodl’s contribution to positivistic ethics and psychology. Psychology had been a challenge for positivism. Comte argued that whatever psychology is, it could not be an empirical science, as there is no way to observe mental phenomena. In his psychology, Jodl followed F.A. Lange in his rejection of a soul. The soul is a posit that a positivist cannot accept. What, then, is psychology a science of? Brentano had answered that it is the science of phenomena whose nature it is to be directed at an object. Beiser (136) relates Jodl’s (1896, 91) answer to Laas’s correlationism. The most general mark of conscious phenomena is that, in them, a subject is directed on an object: no object without subject; no subject without object. Later positivists would deny this: the given is subjectless (Carnap). One wonders how Jodl would have responded.

Chapter Five is devoted to the work of Ernst Mach, ‘the crucial figure connecting the old positivism of Dühring, Laas, and Jodl to the new positivism of the Vienna circle’ (150). Beiser provides a good overview of Mach’s main works and introduces Mach’s economy principle—roughly, science replaces facts with thoughts that are easier to handle for our purposes and saves thereby mental energy (Mach 1883, 452ff)—that guides his philosophy of science. Beiser (150) notes that Mach ‘was never in danger of falling into oblivion’. Indeed, there is a substantial body of philosophical and exegetical literature about Mach’s work.^[1] Very little of this literature gets looked at in Beiser’s book.

What makes Mach a positivist for Beiser?

Nothing portrays Mach’s positivist leanings more than his penchant for facts, the revelation of which he makes into the goal of all scientific research. […] He had too little appreciation for how facts were determined by the goals and presuppositions of the researcher. (153)

Two critical remarks.

First, Beiser (170) translates Mach’s characterisation of the goal of scientific work, ‘Anpassung der Gedanken an die Tatsachen’, as ‘conformity of thoughts to facts’. The 1914 translation of Mach’s Analysis has ‘adaptation of thoughts to facts’, which seems better: it picks up Mach's Darwin-inspired idea that there is a process that results in thoughts becoming like facts or ‘pictures’ of facts.

Second, philosophers of science came round to the view that observations are theory-laden and depend on presuppositions etc. But Mach’s facts are not observations; they are complexes of elements such as colours, sounds, pressures etc. Such complexes seem neither theory-laden nor determined by goals etc.

Another reason that Mach figures as a positivist is his anti-metaphysical stance. Mach’s famous ‘Anti-metaphysical remarks’ detailed a world of elements without egos or other substances that ground them: ‘the ego is unsalvageable’. Beiser describes an important strand of Mach’s anti-metaphysics as follows:

The ego is not the primary factor, as the idealist thinks, because the ego consists only of the complex of its elements, which are sensations. Sensations are not, therefore the product of the ego but the ego is the product of the sensations (171).

But how do a ‘bunch’ of sensations produce an ego? Mach (1914, 12, 28) outlined an answer to this question that does not figure in Beiser’s chapter. Mach distinguished between real and practical unities, and he held that realising that the ego is a practical unity will resolve seemingly intractable problems. What unifies some elements into an ego is that the group is so organised as to minimise pain and maximise pleasure. The problems and questions that pertain to this teleological view are important as, for example, Erich Becher (1905, 546-8) claimed that they suggest that Mach endorses a metaphysics of the will.

The final chapter of the book introduces the reader to Richard Avenarius. Now largely forgotten, Avenarius was highly influential at the end of the nineteenth and beginning of the twentieth century.^[2] Avenarius was close in philosophical outlook to Mach. Beiser (194-5) helpfully highlights that Avenarius (like Mach) started from Herbart’s philosophy. The Herbartian soul has the drive to preserve itself against external influences. In Avenarius’s Philosophie als Denken der Welt, this drive turns out to be the drive of an organism to save energy, and the organism’s thinking is in the service of this drive. Our concepts of thing and substance are energy saving instruments to which nothing corresponds in fundamental reality (see Avenarius 1876, 56).

Beiser takes his readers through Avenarius later works Kritik der reinen Erfahrung and Der Menschliche Weltbegriff. According to Avenarius, we start out from a natural worldview that is free of philosophical problems. However, then we fall from grace because we start to introject (210-11). Introjection consists in fallaciously ascribing to others internal representations of the environment. Introjection leads to ‘dangerous’ dichotomies: inner-outer, subject-object. Introjection was Avenarius claim to fame. It has its own entry in Baldwin’s Dictionary of Philosophy and Psychology (I, 566-7) written by George Frederick Stout.

Avenarius took the positivist view to its limit. Schlick wrote about positivism that it tries

To revert to the most primary world-view imaginable. Now, strictly speaking, this can only be done by sacrificing all science for there is no knowledge unshaped by mental processes or devoid of any contribution of thought. (1916, 191)

If we manage to revert to the natural worldview, philosophical (‘pseudo’) problems will vanish. But, if we are not careful, the same will go for scientific knowledge. Positivists would go on to wrestle with this problem.

REFERENCES

Avenarius, Richard. 1876. Philosophie als Denken der Welt gemäß dem Prinzip des kleinsten Kraftmaßes. Leipzig: Fues.

Baldwin, James M. (1901) (ed.) Dictionary of Philosophy and Psychology, Vol. 1 .London/New York: MacMillan.

Becher, Erich. 1905. The Philosophical Views of Ernst Mach. The Philosophical Review 14, 535-62.

James, William. (1908) Letter to Norman Kemp Smith (23.1.1908), in: James, H. 1920 (ed.) The Letters of William James, 301. Boston: Atlantic Monthly Press.

Jodl, Friedrich, 1896. Lehrbuch der Psychologie, Vol. I. Stuttgart: Verlag der J.G. Cotta'schen Buchhandlung.

Kemp Smith, Norman. 1906. Avenarius’ Philosophy of Pure Experience I/II. Mind 15, 13-31/149-60.

Laas, Ernst. 1879-83. Idealismus und Positivismus I-III. Berlin: Weidmann.

Mach, Ernst. 1883. Die Mechanik in Ihrer Entwicklung Historisch-Kritisch Dargestellt. Leipzig: Brockhaus.

Mach, Ernst. 1914. The Analysis of Sensations and the Relation of the Physical to the Mental. Translation of the 5^thedition of Die Analyse der Empfindungen und das Verhältnis des Physischen zum Psychischen. Chicago and London: Open Court.

Preston, John. 2021. Interpreting Mach. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

Schlick, Moritz. 1916. Idealität des Raumes, Introjektion und das psychophysiches Problem. Vierteljahrsschrift für wissenschaftliche Philosophie und Soziologie 40, 230-54. Translated in his Philosophical Papers I, 190-207. Dordrecht: Reidel.

Schlick, Moritz. 1925. Allgemeine Erkenntnislehre. Second Edition. Berlin: Springer. Translated as General Theory of Knowledge by A.E. Blumenberg. New York/Wien: Springer 1974.